Bioethics in Latin America

First published Fri Mar 13, 2026

“Latin American bioethics” is an ambiguous label. It can refer to bioethics as practiced in Latin American countries or by Latin American bioethicists (even if they do not reside in the region), to non-Latin Americans who have been trained or work in the region, or to a peculiarly “Latin American” way of approaching the discipline. The discussion is not only semantic, but has some meta-philosophical or even political implications. Obviously, the philosophers discussed in this entry are Latin American, in the loose sense that they are of Latin American origin, work at least partly in Latin America, or deal with Latin American bioethical problems from a philosophical perspective. However, this definition is not sufficient. Among these philosophers, there are some who have published on universal problems of bioethics in the most prestigious international journals or publishers. In addition to some of the contributions of Latin American philosophers and bioethicists to general bioethics, this entry emphasizes the application of ethical principles and values to bioethical dilemmas and challenges in the context of Latin American societies. While bioethics as a discipline has universal principles and controversies, Latin American bioethics emphasizes certain cultural, social, and economic factors that are characteristic of the region, such as poverty, vulnerability, lack of access to health care, indigenous rights, migration, cultural diversity, historical legacies and colonialism, the impact of Catholic and Evangelical morality on some of these issues, and the relationship between secularism and bioethics. Latin American bioethicists often engage in discussions that reflect the particular concerns and priorities of the region, such as abortion and reproductive rights, access to health care, social justice, professional ethics, and many others. Thus, while bioethics in Latin America draws from and contributes to the broader field of bioethics, it also has its own distinctive focus and perspective shaped by the specific context of Latin American societies.

1. The Evolution of Bioethics in Latin America

Bioethics in Latin America has evolved through a dynamic interplay between global influences and regional realities. Initially introduced as a foreign concept in the 1980s, bioethics was met with skepticism, especially due to its perceived alignment with U.S. cultural and ethical frameworks, which often conflicted with the dominant Catholic and paternalistic medical traditions in the region.[1]

Initially, Latin American bioethical debates, including those on reproduction, were significantly shaped by the prominent role of the Catholic Church in a region where most of the population is Catholic—although there has been a growing presence of Evangelical churches: in 2023, about one-fifth of Latin Americans identified as Evangelical, up from one-tenth in 2002 (Economist 2023; see also Malamud 2018 [Other Internet Resources]). In bioethics, the Catholic natural rights perspective is often complemented by personalism, which provides a framework for understanding the deeper moral dimensions of human existence and relationships. While natural rights theories may focus on individual autonomy and rights, personalism expands the ethical discourse to include considerations of solidarity, compassion, and the common good (Guerra López 2003; Taboada 2008).

Latin American bioethics has thus evolved through various influences, notably from Catholic morality, which brings a rather conservative and personalist perspective—distinct from the more liberal Anglo-Saxon approach. Over time, some scholars advocated for a more secular approach, arguing that public policies should rest on transparent, evidence-based reasoning rather than on any unexamined dogmatic premises (Vázquez 2004; Vaggione 2013; Gutiérrez Martínez & Mocellin Raymundo 2018; Ortiz-Millán 2024). It is important to note, however, that religious perspectives continue to contribute to the debate. The concern is not with the use of religious arguments per se, but with ensuring that any ideological stance—be it religious, political, or otherwise—is presented openly and not imposed dogmatically.

Over time, bioethics became more accepted and began to be institutionalized through university programs and integration into health care and public policy. Rather than simply adopting external models, Latin American scholars and practitioners adapted bioethical thinking to reflect the region’s unique philosophical, social, and political contexts. This led to a richer, more theoretical and community-focused approach that sometimes contrasted with the individualistic emphasis often found in U.S. bioethics.

In the last few decades, there has been a concerted effort to strengthen bioethics education and capacity-building initiatives throughout Latin America. This includes the creation of bioethics programs, research centers, journals, and academic networks dedicated to promoting ethical reflection and dialogue in health care and biomedical research (Cabrera Cabrera et al. 2024). This period has been characterized by debates motivated by the changing landscape on issues such as abortion, LGBT rights, the environment, and epidemics, among others.

At the national level, the development of bioethics in Latin America has been uneven (for a history of the development of bioethics in each country, see the essays collected in Pessini, Barchifontaine, & Lolas Stepke 2010; Lamm 2012). In some countries this development has been rapid and has been accompanied by institutional support, while in others it has faced obstacles of various kinds.

This entry focuses on six topics that have been actively discussed by Latin American bioethicists: abortion, assisted reproduction, public health ethics, end-of-life, research ethics and autonomy. It is in these areas that some of the most original contributions have been made. There are other areas of bioethics that have had to be left out—such as animal and environmental ethics, neuroethics, ethics training for health professionals, and others—not because they are less important, but for reasons of space. Since this a philosophical entry, interdisciplinary perspectives on bioethics had mostly been left out.

2. Abortion

Public deliberation on controversial issues such as abortion was limited until the 1990s, with bioethics having little impact on public policy or civil discourse. This lack of debate resulted in limited public engagement with and oversight of critical bioethical issues. In the mid-2000s and into the 2020s, Latin American bioethics took a more central position in discussions of reproductive rights. Debates about reproductive rights (especially access to contraception and abortion) and reproductive technologies have been prominent in the region, with bioethicists playing a crucial role in influencing and justifying policies and laws related to these issues.

Many countries in the region have experienced radical legal changes in abortion laws, ranging from a transition to absolute prohibition (in El Salvador, Nicaragua, Honduras, and the Dominican Republic) to the liberalization of abortion laws in Chile and the decriminalization of elective abortion (in Uruguay, Argentina, Colombia, and many states in Mexico). The degree of discussion of the bioethical aspects of abortion varied in these countries, but public debates influenced the process that led to many of these legislative changes during these years. These debates used broader concepts or arguments, such as the notion of personhood, the public health consequences of the abortion ban, women’s sexual and reproductive rights, amongst others, to advocate for legislative change. This section will discuss the feminist approach to abortion (§2.1), how the discussion about the moral status of the fetus has developed in Latin America (§2.2), and the subsequent discussions on conscientious objection (§2.3).

2.1 Feminist Approaches to Abortion

Catholic morality has historically dominated the discourse on reproduction and abortion in Latin America, and it was feminism as a theory and political movement that challenged this domination. During the 1960s and 70s, second wave feminism embraced the struggle for what was then started to be called “reproductive rights” (Bellucci 2014). Feminism has influenced Latin American bioethics by introducing new forms of political dialogue and challenging traditional regulations around issues such as reproduction and abortion. In particular, feminist bioethicists have been academic protagonists who have used bioethics as a tool for social critique and the defense of women’s rights, which is crucial in debates on abortion (Diniz & Guilhem 2008).

Unlike the bioethical dispute on abortion in the United States, where much of the debate revolves around the moral status of the embryo, in Latin America the theoretical framework of the debate has mostly been framed in terms of the public health consequences of criminalizing abortion, women’s rights, as well as the need for a secular state.

Latin American feminism has been vocal in pointing out the negative consequences of the criminalization of abortion for women and other pregnant people’s health. This is not surprising, given the impact that restrictive abortion laws have in terms of unsafe abortion. Latin America and the Caribbean have some of the most restrictive abortion laws and policies in the world (see Center for Reproductive Rights, CRR, in Other Internet Resources). These are some of the key issues raised by Latin American feminists:

  • Criminalizing abortion does not eliminate the practice, but drives it underground, resulting in unsafe and clandestine abortions that pose significant risks to women’s health and lives and contribute to maternal morbidity and mortality (Schiavon, Troncoso, & Polo 2012; Romero et al. 2021). For example, between 2010 and 2014, only about one in four abortions in Latin America and the Caribbean were safe. 60% of all the procedures fell into the less safe category. Complications from abortion account for 10% of maternal deaths (Guttmacher Institute 2018).
  • Legal restrictions on abortion create barriers to accessing reproductive health services, particularly for marginalized and persons with vulnerabilities. Restrictive abortion laws disproportionately affect low-income, indigenous, rural, and young women, who may lack resources and face stigma and discrimination when seeking abortion care (Rivas et al. 2009; Cisne, Castro, & de Oliveira 2018).
  • Criminalization of abortion exacerbates health inequalities by limiting poor women’s access to safe and legal abortion services, while in practice, wealthy women can obtain an equally illegal abortion under the safe conditions of a private doctor (“the rich have abortions, the poor die” has been echoed by feminists across the region). Many feminists have argued that access to safe abortion should be recognized as a fundamental reproductive right and an essential component of comprehensive health services (Cisne, Castro, & de Oliveira 2018; Medina-Arellano et al. 2023).
  • Central to the feminist critique of the criminalization of abortion is the principle of reproductive autonomy and bodily autonomy. Feminists argue that women should have the right to make decisions about their own bodies and reproduction, including the right to access safe and legal abortion services without fear of punishment or persecution (Lamas 2007; Lerner, Guillaume, & Melgar 2016).
  • The need for a secular state has also been central to feminist discourse. Religiously motivated laws may restrict access to abortion services or criminalize abortion altogether, thereby limiting women’s reproductive autonomy and right to choose based on their own beliefs and values. A secular state is often closely associated with the protection of human rights and equality before the law, as well as with the principle that laws and policies should be based on secular, rational, and evidence-based considerations rather than religious dogma (Lamas 2007; Busdygan 2013; Felitti & Prieto 2018; Capdevielle & Arlettaz 2019; Mayans 2019).

2.2 The Moral Status of the Embryo

While most of the argumentation in Latin American bioethics has revolved around the morality of restrictive abortion laws, the response from pro-life positions has focused on the moral status of the embryo, as well as fetal rights. According to this position, none of the social and public health costs of criminalizing abortion justifies the murder of unborn human beings with a right to life. Proponents of this view argue that this is what feminists and liberals often ignore when they argue for decriminalization, invoking the public health consequences of abortion, or speaking of women’s right to choose. On this view, appeals to public health and women’s rights do not weaken the pro-life argument in the least. Although not as prominent as the debates on public health and women’s rights, there have been some debates on the moral status of the embryo in Latin America.

2.2.1 Personalism

At the forefront of the debate against the liberalization of abortion laws, Catholic bioethics has played a crucial role. It has traditionally been based on the Thomistic understanding of natural rights, which asserts that individuals possess certain inherent rights by virtue of their humanity. These rights are often understood as natural, inalienable, and independent of social or cultural context. This perspective, as already mentioned, has been complemented with personalism. In personalism, the concept of personhood is central to ethical considerations, particularly in relation to issues such as abortion and some forms of assisted reproduction, such as those involving in vitro fertilization (IVF). Personalism asserts that each individual possesses inherent dignity and worth by virtue of being a person. In personalism, personhood is primarily grounded in the intrinsic dignity of the human being. Personalists emphasize the inherent value of every human person, regardless of their cognitive capacity, age, or condition (e.g., unborn, elderly, disabled). While personalists do acknowledge aspects like relationality, moral agency, and self-awareness as important features of personhood, these are not preconditions for being a person. Instead, the human being is seen as a person by virtue of their being, not by what they can do or demonstrate cognitively. In the context of abortion, personalist bioethics argues that the embryo should be considered a person from the moment of conception.

Personalist arguments have been influential and used to advocate for legal restrictions on abortion and to promote the protection of fetal rights from conception (Casas Martínez et al. 2009; Gudiño Bessone 2018; Banti 2020).

2.2.2 Secular and Liberal Perspectives

Given the emphasis placed on this issue by conservative positions, many bioethicists with secular and liberal positions have responded by proposing different conceptions of personhood and the moral status of embryos.

Margarita Valdés (1999) has provided one of the most detailed accounts of personhood in Latin American bioethics. She addresses the concept of personhood by distinguishing several concepts to counter arguments against abortion. Valdés argues that the biological concept of personhood sometimes used by pro-life groups, which claims that anyone with Homo sapiens DNA is a person, is flawed. She points out that all cells in the human body have human DNA, but not all are considered persons. Valdés emphasizes that a fertilized egg lacks the characteristics of living adult persons, such as a conscious mental life, which is essential for attributing moral status and personhood. A fertilized egg or embryo without a developed cerebral cortex lacks the intrinsic moral properties that compel us to consider it a person. Valdés concludes that the absence of significant moral properties means that a zygote or early embryo, as a collection of cells, does not warrant the moral consideration given to a person with psychological capacities. Other philosophers have given similar accounts (Ortiz Millán 2009, 2019), arguing that even though we usually have a more complex conception of personhood that includes self-consciousness and rationality, consciousness is the minimum necessary condition for attributing personhood to an embryo, and these are only made possible by the appearance of a developed cerebral cortex, something that happens at the end of the second trimester of pregnancy. Before that point, abortion is morally permissible.

2.3 Conscientious Objection

While conscientious objection (CO) is a generally debated issue in Latin America, the liberalization of abortion laws in some countries has intensified discussions on the topic (Ramón-Michel et al. 2024). The debate centers on whether to prioritize healthcare professionals’ moral autonomy or patients’ right to medical services. Those in favor of CO view it as a fundamental human right tied to religious and moral convictions, arguing that forcing professionals to perform procedures they object to violates their moral integrity (Casas Martínez et al. 2009; Marcó Bach 2022). This “integrity” (Diniz 2011) model grants near-absolute rights to objectors, with exceptions only for life-threatening cases. Opponents argue that CO restricts access to legal healthcare, disproportionately affecting poor and rural women, as seen in regions where CO rates among medical professionals reach extreme levels (e.g., Mexico City and Chile). They emphasize the professional duty of healthcare workers to provide care based on evidence and public health needs, asserting that if CO undermines care, it should not be permitted (Alegre 2019). Some scholars advocate a middle ground, proposing regulatory measures like mandatory referrals to non-objecting providers and written justifications for CO claims (Diniz 2011; Capdevielle 2015; Ortiz Millán 2018; Ramón-Michel et al. 2020). However, critics argue that referrals may be insufficient in ensuring reproductive rights. A widely supported solution is enforcing clear regulations to ensure that patient care is not compromised and mandating objecting professionals to provide services when no alternatives exist, particularly when a woman’s life or health is at risk. This debate reflects broader ethical tensions between individual moral integrity and the right to equitable healthcare access in Latin America.

3. Debates on Assisted Reproduction Techniques (ART)

Latin American countries began to adopt ART technologies in the 1980s. As medical and technological capabilities expanded in the region in the 1980s and 1990s, discussions about infertility and ART became more common, and medical professionals and bioethicists began to explore these issues, leading to more widespread public discussion. In the 1990s and early 2000s, as ART became more accessible and popular, ethical and legal debates, particularly about the lack of regulation, began to emerge. The moral perspective of the Catholic Church, which, as has already been mentioned, has a significant influence in the region, often informed these discussions. Bioethical debates have focused on the morality, legality, and accessibility of these technologies, as well as on their implementation in the specific context of Latin America. This section focuses, first, on how the Artavia Murillo case changed the traditional perception of ARTs as represented by the Catholic Church (§3.1). Second, it deals with some ethical problems of ARTs in the social context of the region (§3.2). Finally, the case of surrogacy is discussed (§3.3).

3.1 The Catholic Perspective and the Artavia Murillo Case

Given the predominant presence of Catholicism in some countries in the region, it is not uncommon for many bioethicists to adopt a religious perspective, while others try to follow a secular one, distancing themselves from Catholic positions (Zegers-Hochschild 1999, 2016). The Catholic perspective has influenced public opinion, legislation and policy in many countries in the region, leading to restrictive laws on ART. The most prominent example of such legislation is the case of Costa Rica, which banned IVF and even heterologous insemination in 2000. This ban was the result of a ruling by the Constitutional Chamber of the Supreme Court of Costa Rica, which declared IVF unconstitutional because it violated the embryo’s right to life, emphasizing that the embryo should be recognized as a person from the moment of conception.

The belief that life begins at conception underlies Catholic opposition to many forms of ARTs, especially those that may involve the manipulation and destruction of embryos, such as IVF or ICSI (intracytoplasmic sperm injection) (Colombo 1999). In addition, the Church promotes the idea that procreation should take place by natural means within the context of marriage between a man and a woman. This is the case for technologies such as IVF, ICSI, artificial insemination, and surrogacy. Hence, this view promotes the idea that children should be conceived through the sexual intercourse of a married couple.

A group of couples affected by this ban filed a complaint with the Inter-American Commission on Human Rights, claiming that the ban violated their rights to privacy, family, reproductive freedom, and equality. After the Commission ruled in their favor, the case was referred to the Inter-American Court of Human Rights (IACHR), which also ruled in their favor in 2012 in the case Artavia Murillo et al. (In Vitro Fertilization) vs. Costa Rica. The Court emphasized that the right to life from conception, as enshrined in the American Convention on Human Rights (ACHR), does not imply an absolute protection of life and must be balanced with other fundamental rights, such as reproductive rights (IACHR 2012). In fact, the Court ruled that the term “conception” should be understood as “implantation” rather than “fertilization,” which has significant moral and legal implications. Though it yields an interesting conclusion, Eduardo Rivera-López pointed out that the argument commits a naturalistic fallacy by attempting to support a normative conclusion based solely on empirical premises (Rivera-López 2013).

Before the Court ruled on this case, some bioethicists approached the issue from a gender and human rights perspective. Florencia Luna (2008b), for example, portrays the Latin American context as one in which women are expected to fulfill societal expectations of motherhood, but are often denied the means to do so because of inconsistent moral and legal frameworks. This situation, she argues, can be characterized as one of a moral double standard. She emphasizes that access to these technologies is a matter of reproductive rights and gender equality and non-discrimination. However, this does not mean unlimited access but rather access within reasonable boundaries. She advocates for state responsibility to ensure the protection and fulfillment of reproductive rights (for example, access to abortion) as part of broader human rights obligations.

The Artavia Murillo ruling has prompted some Latin American countries to reconsider restrictive laws on ART, with the aim of increasing access. However, most countries lack comprehensive legal frameworks, leaving critical decisions such as limits on embryo transfer, genetic diagnosis, donor anonymity, and access for same-sex couples and single women largely unregulated (Zegers-Hochschild 2016). Other new reproductive technologies, such as mitochondrial replacement techniques, are also unregulated (Palacios-González & Medina-Arellano 2017).

3.2 Social Context and Ethical Issues

Latin American bioethicists have discussed different ethical issues related to ARTs, but probably their most important contributions to these debates are those that call attention to the influence of local contexts on the implementation of these technologies and that emphasize the need to integrate ARTs into comprehensive reproductive health services that respect women’s rights.

One of the aspects in which the reality of the region differs from that of countries with higher incomes is infertility Luna (2001b; Luna & Wolf 2014) elaborates on the concept of secondary infertility. She refers to the secondary infertility due to the after-effects of infections or unsafe abortions. These conditions, common in underdeveloped health systems, contrast with infertility in more developed regions, where it is often associated with delayed childbearing. She highlights the role of inadequate reproductive health services and lack of education in contributing to secondary infertility in Latin America. These issues disproportionately affect women in lower socioeconomic classes, contributing to a significant percentage of infertility cases. Many of these issues are the result of restrictive abortion laws and poor sexual education, which stem from the Catholic perspective on sexual morality prevalent in the region.

On the other hand, there is a significant debate about who should have access to ARTs. In some Latin American countries, there is a stark contrast between those who can afford private health care, where such technologies are more readily available, and those who rely on underfunded public health systems (Souza 2014; Zegers-Hochschild 2016). This raises issues of social justice and equity. Marilena Corrêa and Ilana Löwy (2020) highlight the social justice issues surrounding the accessibility and implementation of these technologies in a middle-income country such as Brazil, with significant health care inequalities. Despite the existence of a national health service (Sistema Único de Saúde or SUS) that theoretically includes access to ART, in practice, the majority of Brazilian women cannot benefit from these treatments. About 25% of the population has private health insurance, but the quality of coverage varies widely; structural inequalities affect reproductive health services (Diniz et al. 2009). ART was introduced in Brazil in the mid-1980s, primarily through private clinics; the SUS provides limited access to ART, with only a few centers offering free or partially funded treatment. The high cost of ART means that it is primarily accessible to wealthy women, while poorer women struggle to afford these treatments. Creative solutions such as clinical trials and egg-sharing programs have been used to help low-income women access ART, but these benefit only a small fraction of the population. Corrêa and Löwy frame the inability of poor Brazilians to access ART as a social justice issue, highlighting the link between poverty and reproductive health challenges. They argue for increased public and low-cost access to fertility treatment through the SUS and public-private partnerships.

In contrast, the situation regarding ART legislation in Argentina is very different. Law 26.862, enacted in 2013, provides universal access to ART treatments, including coverage of up to four low-complexity and three high-complexity treatments per year through the public health system. It does not impose any age restrictions, allowing access to single women and same-sex couples. However, while the law is progressive in some respects (and overly broad in the number of treatments to be provided), it overlooks critical issues such as the status and use of cryopreserved embryos. In fact, in 2024 there were cases in the Courts, because fertility clinics do not know whether they are legally allowed to destroy spared embryos. However, there was an inconsistency in Argentina’s abortion laws at the time (abortion was decriminalized in Argentina in 2021), since while the country allowed ART, including treatments that sometimes required the destruction of multiple implanted embryos, it simultaneously restricted access to “non ART” abortions.

Another issue of ethical concern for bioethicists in the region is that ART often serves classist, sexist, racist, and eugenic agendas. Fátima Oliveira (2001), for example, emphasizes that ARTs are often classist, favoring those who can afford the expensive treatments, while poor women are particularly vulnerable, being used as sources of oocytes in exchange for financial compensation, leading to exploitation. She criticizes the commercialization and industrialization of reproductive materials, including the trafficking of embryos, sperm, and oocytes; these are practices that often occur under the guise of “donation” but essentially exploit the socioeconomically disadvantaged. Oliveira also criticizes cases in which the racial preferences of clients dictate the selection of gametes, thereby reinforcing racist ideologies. The eugenic implications of selecting for specific traits such as intelligence, physical appearance, and other desired characteristics are highlighted as deeply problematic. This trend reflects a dangerous quest for “genetic purity” and “perfection.” Oliveira argues that it is the responsibility of the state to regulate and control the use of these experimental techniques, ensuring that they are safe and ethically sound.

3.3 Surrogacy

One of the most debated bioethical issues relating to ARTs in Latin America is surrogacy. Surrogacy is an arrangement in which a woman agrees to become pregnant and bear a child for another individual or couple, known as the intended parent(s). Over time, surrogacy has become a widely used reproductive technique, and Latin America has not been immune to the ethical debates surrounding it. These debates have sought to justify clear legislation, as in most of the region the legal status of surrogacy is uncertain and the validity of surrogacy contracts is left to judicial discretion (Hevia 2019; Higuita Jaramillo & Gómez Rúa 2023).[2] This type of legal uncertainty leaves surrogates, intended parents, and resulting children unprotected.

Among the major ethical issues surrounding surrogacy, Latin American bioethicists have addressed the moral justification for banning it or allowing and regulating it, and whether commercial or altruistic surrogacy should be allowed. Central to these debates is the potential for exploitation of surrogates, particularly in cases where economic disparities make commercial surrogacy one of the few viable financial options for some women. There are ethical concerns about treating the body and reproductive capacities as commodities that can be bought and sold.

Catholic and Evangelical perspectives have expressed concern about the potential exploitation and commodification of women in surrogacy, as these practices can reduce women to the role of child bearers, thus undermining their dignity and reducing them to commodities. Surrogacy is opposed by these religions, not only because it separates conception from the sexual act, but also because it involves third parties in the procreation process, complicating parental roles and potentially commodifying the process of conception and the child itself (Olavarría 2022).

However, religious perspectives are not alone in their opposition to surrogacy. Radical feminists also oppose it for a variety of reasons. Alicia Puleo (2017), for instance, understands commercial surrogacy (or “womb renting,” as she prefers to call it) as a form of extractivism in the context of globalization, arguing that it perpetuates inequality and exploitation based on gender, class, and race, especially in the Global South. She sees commercial surrogacy as a continuation of exploitative practices in which women from poorer countries are used for the benefit of wealthier individuals from the Global North. This practice is described as a form of neocolonial violence that exploits women’s bodies in the same way that natural resources are extracted from their countries. She also examines the notion of “free consent” in surrogacy, arguing that economic desperation undermines true autonomy. She emphasizes the need for a gender-sensitive approach to bioethics that recognizes the social and economic pressures that influence women’s choices. If surrogacy is not to be banned, she argues, there should at least be stricter regulation and ethical scrutiny to protect vulnerable women and ensure that their autonomy is truly respected. Puleo is not alone in her position: many other feminists in the region insist that surrogacy is a form of patriarchal capitalist exploitation and alienation of women’s bodies. They argue that surrogacy should be banned or heavily regulated to counter these exploitative dynamics (Maffía & Gómez 2019; see also Blázquez Graf et al. 2022).

However, many bioethicists in the region do not see banning commercial surrogacy as the way forward (Pietrini Sánchez 2022). Martín Hevia (2019), for example, argues that a ban would prevent women who autonomously want to enter into a commercial surrogacy contract from doing so, and would also violate the IACHR’s Artavia Murillo decision, which stated that a total ban on reproductive technologies interferes with an individual’s right to privacy and to form a family, which includes the decision to become a parent and access to the means to do so. Hevia proposes measures to prevent exploitation, such as fair compensation and informed consent, i.e., ensuring that surrogates fully understand and agree to the medical procedures and legal implications involved in commercial surrogacy. Instead of a ban, he suggests that commercial surrogacy should be regulated to protect the rights of surrogates, intended parents, and resulting children.

4. Public Health Ethics

Many of the issues that have been treated in the global discussion from an (interpersonal) ethical point of view are usually approached by Latin American bioethicists as public policy issues; this is the case with abortion, CO and, in general, ethical problems of reproduction. Something similar is also the case with the ethics of biomedical research using human subjects. This section provides a very general overview of the main lines of thought in public health (§4.1), and then focuses on specific problems of justice and public health in the context of epidemics and radical scarcity of therapeutic resources (§4.2).

4.1 Distributive Justice Debates

At least three general approaches to public health bioethics can be distinguished. First, some bioethicists take a radically critical position toward mainstream bioethics. In particular, this approach argues that the principlist view, famously developed by Beauchamp and Childress (1979), is not adequate to thinking about the problems of public health justice in Latin America.[3] The critique of principlism is essentially twofold. On the one hand, this approach is seen as methodologically individualistic, focusing on medical ethics as a personal relationship between a patient and a doctor, and not taking into account the social determinants and political considerations involved in health care. On the other hand, the principled approach neglects, or does not sufficiently take into consideration, the rights involved in medical care (Tealdi 2005). In contrast to this view, Tealdi (2005) proposes a human rights-based public health paradigm (see also Penchaszadeh 2022).

Second, some Latin American authors have made critical assessments of the health systems in their own countries, or proposals for achieving more equitable systems, drawing on the theoretical frameworks of mainstream contemporary political philosophy, such as the theories of John Rawls, Norman Daniels, Amartya Sen, and analytical Marxism, among others. For example, Bertomeu and Vidiella (2002) evaluate the Argentine health care system in light of Rawls’s theory of justice and Sen’s theory of capabilities. Their aim is to criticize health policies that target the poorest while leaving the rest of the population to rely on the market. With a similar purpose, Zúñiga Fajuri (2011) analyzes the Chilean health plan (“Plan AUGE”). Zúñiga Fajuri criticizes the criterion of health care rationing based on efficiency and the use of QALYs, ignoring distributive and equity considerations. A similar critique can be found in Ortega Bolaños and González (2017) in the context of the Colombian social security and health system. From the Rawlsian egalitarian tradition, Machado Martins et al. (2023) provide a defense of the Brazilian Single Healthcare System (SUS).

Finally, and sometimes in connection with the previous approaches, there are contributions that have a more general or theoretical aim, inspired by some of the theories of justice mentioned above. For example, Zúñiga Fajuri (2014) rescues the Marxian principle of distributing resources according to needs. Since their satisfaction is a precondition of autonomy, or even of moral personality, their distribution should not, in her view, include considerations of individual responsibility, such as those defended by luck egalitarianism. A much more ambitious and general analysis of the issue of distributive justice in health care can be found in Dieterlen (2014). Dieterlen provides a comprehensive and detailed account of the main theories of distributive justice in general (Rawls, Sen, Dworkin) as well as in relation to the health care system (especially Daniels and Buchanan).

These different lines of thinking about health justice and health systems in general are reflected in different ways in the face of specific challenges.

4.2 Public Health and Epidemics

Bioethics in Latin America has evolved significantly in response to epidemics, especially since the HIV/AIDS crisis of the 1980s. Initially focused on medical ethics and patients’ rights, the field expanded to address public health issues, including access to treatment, stigma, and social justice. Bioethicists emphasized the need for equitable health care, the protection of vulnerable populations, and the ethical implications of public health policies. Over time, bioethics in the region has grown to encompass broader societal issues, advocating for human rights and social justice in the face of health crises such as HIV/AIDS, Zika, COVID-19, and others.

The AIDS epidemic, which began in the early 1980s, had a profound impact in Latin America, with significant public health, social and economic consequences. The region faced high rates of infection, particularly among marginalized groups such as men who have sex with men, female sex workers, and intravenous drug users (Meihack Miller et al. 2013). Stigma, discrimination, and limited access to health care exacerbated the crisis. Governments and NGOs responded with varying degrees of success, promoting prevention, education, and treatment initiatives. Despite these efforts, the epidemic highlighted deep social inequalities and the urgent need for improved health infrastructure and human rights protections across the region. Philosophers and bioethicists joined these discussions.

Mark Platts—a British philosopher who has lived in Mexico since the mid-1980s and is largely responsible for introducing philosophical bioethics to the Mexican academy in the early 1990s—is one of the philosophers who have been involved in discussing the ethical aspects of AIDS. In a book devoted to the subject (1999), Platts examines the moral and social implications of epidemics, focusing particularly on the case of HIV/AIDS in the Mexican context. Platts criticizes the moralization of sexual behavior, especially homosexuality, and advocates for a moral framework that respects autonomy while avoiding dogmatism and authoritarianism. He published his book at a time when Mexican society was quite homophobic. He also discusses tolerance, the role of education, and the importance of addressing moral and ethical dimensions in public health. Education, not science alone, is the key to combating the pandemic, but it must be carefully designed to respect individual autonomy and promote active participation in social processes. All of these discussions are intertwined with a defense of moral objectivism and a critique of the idea that moral subjectivism naturally leads to tolerance. Platts explores how an objective moral framework can accommodate tolerance. He contrasts this with intolerant attitudes, particularly those that seek to impose moral judgments through legal and social means, such as policies targeting marginalized groups like homosexuals and people living with HIV/AIDS. He highlights the dangers of these attitudes, which often mask a desire to inflict harm under the guise of moral correction.

The Zika epidemic in Brazil, which began in 2015, provided another opportunity for critical reflection. Zika, transmitted by the Aedes aegypti mosquito, primarily affected the northeastern region. The virus, which usually causes mild symptoms, posed serious risks to pregnant women, leading to Congenital Zika Syndrome (CZS), including microcephaly in newborn babies. The outbreak highlighted the intersection of social inequality, inadequate health infrastructure, and gender inequality, with marginalized communities bearing the brunt of the crisis. The epidemic also garnered global attention, raising critical ethical concerns about international collaboration, research practices, reproductive rights, and the marginalization of local scientific efforts in responding to the crisis, amongst other issues (Rego & Palácios 2016). Brazilian bioethicists have addressed some of these issues, and of particular relevance is Debora Diniz’s book on Zika (2016 [2017]). Diniz’s work foregrounds the human dimension of the Zika epidemic, especially the experiences of women. She emphasizes that the suffering caused by Zika goes beyond physical symptoms, highlighting the emotional and psychological toll on women who were pregnant during the outbreak. This human-centered approach raises important bioethical questions about how the medical community should engage with patients during epidemics, not just as research subjects, but as individuals with agency and rights. Diniz criticizes the scientific community’s approach to the Zika outbreak, particularly the exploitation of women and their children as mere data points in research, and urges respect for the dignity of human subjects. She links the impact of the epidemic to broader issues of social inequality and inadequate health care in Brazil, which disproportionately affect marginalized communities. Her book also examines the intersection of gender inequality and reproductive rights, criticizing the Brazilian government’s response for prioritizing abstinence and delaying pregnancy rather than providing women with the resources and options they need, such as access to family planning services and abortion.

On the relationship between Zika and reproductive rights, Luna (2017) argues that given the risks associated with CZS, women should have the right to decide whether to continue or terminate pregnancies affected by Zika; she emphasizes autonomy, respect for values, and the mental health of the mother as critical in making these decisions. Local and international health authorities have an obligation to provide comprehensive sexual and reproductive health services, including access to contraception and safe abortion, especially for impoverished women who are disproportionately affected by Zika. She criticizes the policies that promote pregnancy delay, without addressing access to reproductive health care; these recommendations are unrealistic, especially in contexts where contraception and abortion are restricted.

Not long after the Zika epidemic, Latin American bioethicists extensively discussed several critical issues related to the COVID-19 pandemic, particularly in the context of the region’s diverse socioeconomic and public health challenges. The tension between protecting public health and respecting individual rights, particularly through lockdowns and digital surveillance, was a focal point, raising concerns about privacy and civil liberties. Daniel Loewe (2020), for example, examined the complexities involved in implementing lockdowns. He criticized the oversimplification of the public debate, which focused narrowly on the dichotomy of either protecting the economy or protecting lives. Loewe argued that measures to control the spread of COVID-19 should have been evaluated on the basis of principles such as temporary limitation, reasonableness, non-arbitrary discrimination, minimal infringement of civil liberties, and respect for privacy. He claimed that these principles were systematically violated in the response to the pandemic. On the issue of digital surveillance, some authors stressed the urgency of creating a new ethical framework for data management, not only globally but especially in Latin America and the Caribbean, where existing inequalities and weak institutions increase the risks of data misuse during crises such as the COVID-19 pandemic (Sorokin et al. 2020).

The pandemic also highlighted the ethical dilemmas of resource allocation, such as the principles that guide ICU triage at peak times and the frameworks for decision-making in situations of scarcity (Rivera-López et al. 2020; Aguilera 2020; Aurenque et al. 2021; Linares Salgado 2022). Bioethicists intervened to justify different frameworks and principles to guide triage decisions. These frameworks included principles such as maximizing overall benefit (utilitarian approaches), ensuring equal access (egalitarian approaches), prioritizing patients with the highest chance of recovery, or giving special consideration to vulnerable groups.

The social inequalities exposed by the pandemic, including the disproportionate impact on vulnerable populations (such as women, children, and migrants), gave rise to discussions on the ethical responsibility of governments to address these inequalities (Manrique de Lara & Medina Arellano 2020; Manrique de Lara & Ramírez 2021; Rendón 2021). Maria Clara Dias and Fabio Oliveira (2023) argue that the COVID-19 pandemic exacerbated existing social inequalities in Brazil, disproportionately affecting marginalized groups such as blacks, indigenous communities, women, the LGBT population, and people living in poverty. Structural problems, exacerbated by political mismanagement, limited access to health care, sanitation, and testing, leaving these groups vulnerable to serious illness and death. The authors link these inequalities to Brazil’s colonial history and neoliberal policies. They propose a decolonial moral framework, the Functionings Approach, to address these injustices through public policies that meet the specific needs of vulnerable populations and prevent future pandemics from deepening structural inequalities.[4]

The phenomenon of vaccine nationalism and the need for global solidarity have been important ethical concerns, with calls for equitable vaccine distribution and international cooperation to support less affluent regions. For example, Holzer et al. (2023) examine whether vaccine donations by the international community and the COVID-19 global access facility, COVAX, provided effective solutions to address inequitable distribution. They contrast the notions of “donation” and “charity” with “vaccine equity” and “empowerment” of poorer countries. They argue that achieving equitable global vaccine production requires a global approach that focuses on empowerment. To achieve this goal and truly address the needs of the global poor, structural reforms, particularly capacity building, are essential. These reforms would ensure a more equitable and sustainable impact on vaccine distribution efforts.

5. End of Life

There are two fundamental facts that must be taken into account regarding the practice of end-of-life medicine in Latin America. On the one hand, specific medical services for patients at the end of life are insufficient. Although the picture is not homogeneous, it can be said with certainty that palliative medicine is underdeveloped in most Latin American countries, and that medical services, both public and private, lack adequate material and human resources to provide this type of care. An indicator of this inadequacy is the fact that, while Latin American countries possess a mere 36% availability of analgesic drugs for terminally ill patients, Europe has an availability rate of 400%, and the USA exhibits an availability rate of 3,000%.[5] The second relevant fact is the strong influence of the Catholic Church and other Christian churches in Latin American societies. These institutions have repeatedly and explicitly expressed their opposition to physician-assisted death (PAD).[6] This second fact has been most relevant in the legal and social spheres, while the first has influenced the philosophical debate to some extent.

The influence of religious conceptions can be observed in the fact that only two Latin American countries have decriminalized PAD: Colombia and Ecuador. In 1997, the Constitutional Court of Colombia ruled that the prohibition of “mercy killing” was unconstitutional in cases where the person voluntarily requests to be killed, suffers from a terminal illness, and is in severe pain or suffering (Díaz Amado 2017). The legalization of PAD in Ecuador is more recent and followed a similar path. In February 2024, Ecuador’s Constitutional Court ruled in favor of an appeal by an amyotrophic lateral sclerosis (ALS) patient who argued that the article of the Penal Code criminalizing PAD was unconstitutional. The debate on PAD in Colombia has focused, in part, on the legal question of whether it is possible to derive a right to PAD from the Constitution (García Pereáñez 2016; Díaz Amado 2017). Critical of the Court’s decision, there are many articles in academic journals closely linked to the Catholic Church, taking a personalist perspective on bioethics (see, for example, Gamboa-Bernal 2017).

Against this background, two issues will be discussed in this section. First, some discussions on PAD and end-of-life medicine related to the social context mentioned above (§5.1); and second, some contributions of Latin American bioethicists to the global discussion on PAD (§5.2).

5.1 Death and Vulnerability in Latin America

In Latin American bioethics, it is unusual to find arguments against PAD that appeal to the problem of vulnerability or to the fact that palliative care services are insufficient or inadequate. Some authors are critical of PAD and claim that palliative care is the only morally acceptable option for terminally ill patients, but they do not explicitly inquire about the relevance of the lack of such services to the debate on the permissibility of PAD (Casas Martínez & Mora Magaña 2017). In a more nuanced position, Leo Pessini (2010) defends what he calls the “palliative filter,” i.e., the obligation to make the alternative of palliative care available to the terminally ill patient. A patient requesting euthanasia must undergo a consultation with a palliative care service. According to Pessini, the experience of palliative care services in Belgium and the Netherlands shows that an active and comprehensive approach (including the option of terminal sedation) can make the request for PAD irrelevant in most cases. There is also some work pointing to the need to develop a social and relational conception of autonomy in the context of end-of-life decisions. According to Ramón Michel (2022), this involves taking seriously the vulnerabilities of people making decisions about PAD. Autonomy should be understood as a complex process, not as a punctual, independent, and individual act of will. Still, she does not go so far as to claim that such complexities make the option of PAD morally inadmissible (more on autonomy and consent in general in section 7).

One of the few works that addresses the relevance of poverty and vulnerability in the Latin American context for the permissibility of PAD is Luna and van Delden (2004). They focus on various arguments for and against allowing PAD and analyze the extent to which these arguments work in contexts such as Latin America. The idea is that a “decent” health system is a prerequisite of the acceptability of PAD. Underdeveloped countries can have a decent health care system to the extent that they fulfill their obligation to improve access to palliative care. The moral acceptability of PAD would only be doubtful in cases where there is no commitment by the state authorities in this direction. On the other hand, other authors recognize the importance of developing and ensuring palliative care, but claim that it would be cruel to deny a patient’s right to PAD until this goal is achieved (e.g., Álvarez del Río 2013).

The issue of vulnerability at the end of life has mainly been addressed in the context of therapeutic options other than PAD. Many Latin American bioethicists distinguish PAD (euthanasia and assisted suicide) from orthothanasia (sometimes called “death with dignity”), dysthanasia (therapeutic futility), and misthanasia (de Araujo 2013). This last concept is the most original and is deeply linked to the vulnerability of the terminally ill in Latin America. Misthanasia (“unhappy death”) is the death of patients as a result of medical malpractice or social, economic or health system failures (Pessini 2004). The issue is obviously related to general health care problems and how the lack of adequate and sufficient resources leads to unnecessary suffering and early death (for data in Brazil, see Penteado Setti da Rocha et al. 2017).

5.2 Philosophical Discussions on Physician-Assisted Death

In addition to contextual considerations about the health care situation in Latin America, the philosophical discussion about end-of-life decisions has remained within the parameters of the global discussion. Rejection of the morality of PAD has come primarily from personalist or Thomistic traditions. In general, these positions assume that the right to life is “inalienable” (see, for example, Merchán-Price 2008: 44). Human beings are not morally allowed to renounce this right. According to these views, however, it is legitimate in some cases to withhold or interrupt life-prolonging treatments. The discussion then focuses on determining in which cases withholding treatment (i.e., “letting the patient die”) should be qualified as a case of killing (by omission) and thus be impermissible, and when such withholding is justified and does not violate the inalienable right to life. There are usually two criteria involved (which may or may not be related). One is the doctrine of double effect. Accordingly, withdrawal of treatment is legitimate when death is a collateral effect of the intended end (relief of suffering), and illegitimate when it is a means to that end. A second criterion is the distinction between proportionate and disproportionate (or extraordinary) measures. Withholding life-prolonging medical treatment would be permissible if prolonging such treatment is disproportionate (Zambrano 2016). The double effect doctrine has also been used by those who oppose PAD but accept terminal sedation. Given that terminal sedation implies the definitive loss of consciousness and is therefore an evil comparable to death, these authors justify the use of terminal sedation by appealing to the aforementioned doctrine: the direct intention is to control refractory pain, while the negative effect (loss of consciousness) is only collateral. Moreover, there is a reasonable balance between the two effects.

In defense of the morality and legalization of PAD, many Latin American philosophers also follow the principles of the global debate. There are at least three lines of argument to be considered. The first points to the inconsistency of accepting the morality of withdrawing life-prolonging treatment (“death with dignity”) and rejecting PAD. In 2013, de Araujo makes this kind of critique, but focuses more specifically on assisted suicide. For de Araujo, allowing the withdrawal of life-sustaining treatment and prohibiting assisted suicide is normatively inconsistent. The reason is that it does not treat patients who are equal in the relevant aspects, but makes the decision dependent on purely contingent and uncontrollable factors. For example, it would be permissible to disconnect a terminally ill lung cancer patient on a ventilator, while a terminally ill pancreatic cancer patient could not be assisted to die. A second type of argument in defense of PAD attempts to undermine the consequentialist argument for banning PAD. In 2013, Álvarez Gálvez provides a detailed analysis and points out the limitations of the slippery slope argument against PAD. To the extent that such an argument is empirical, there is insufficient evidence that the various steps of the slope are solid and that the bad end-state is predictable.

Finally, several authors have attempted to refine or complement the traditional argument for PAD based on the value of autonomy. Eduardo Rivera López (2017) offers an argument that assumes the autonomy-based justification, but attempts to go beyond it. The idea is that physicians who treat terminally ill or seriously suffering patients have a special duty to provide PAD. At least in many cases, they have participated in prolonging the lives of these patients and thus in their present situation of suffering. Therefore, they cannot disengage and evade their responsibilities when PAD is the only way to avoid such suffering. More recently Rivera López (2024) has addressed the relationship between autonomy, withdrawal of treatment and PAD. According to his point of view, and contrary to the standard argument based on patient autonomy, PAD and withdrawal of treatment correlate not only with the right to autonomy, but with two different rights: autonomy and bodily integrity. This move makes it possible to reconcile the permissibility of PAD with the legal prohibition of consensual homicide of healthy persons. At the same time, it avoids falling into positions that are either too permissive (legalizing consensual homicide) or too paternalistic (prohibiting withdrawal of treatment) in a consistent way. Pablo Aguayo Westwood (2020) offers a different way of overcoming the limitations of the autonomy-based justification of PAD. He argues that the fundamental value preserved by allowing PAD is not only autonomy, but also self-respect in the Rawlsian sense. This includes not only our ability to develop a life plan that is valued by ourselves and those close to us, but also the confidence of having access to the means to carry it out.

6. Research Ethics

Research ethics is an area of bioethics that has generated considerable interest in Latin America. There are a large number of descriptive articles explaining the challenges and functioning of research ethics committees (RECs) in different countries (Sabio & Bortz 2015; Cavazos et al. 2002; Echemendía Tocabens 2014; Espinoza et al. 2011). In addition, and perhaps because of the high rates of corruption in the region (Luna 2001b), there have also been many recent articles on integrity in research (Toro et al. 2023; Mastroleo & Bianchini 2021; Rodríguez & Lolas 2011).

A rich area of work is that which examines international multicenter research in Latin America (especially clinical research conducted by pharmaceutical companies). Probably due to a colonial past and experiences of exploitation, this practice is often denounced. In the following sections, we will discuss some of the issues related to this topic: first, the position against research held by some bioethicists, the criticism of the pharmaceutical industry, and the analysis of the concept of exploitation (§6.1); second, the practice of double standards and, in relation to the discussion of the international ethical guidelines, the debate on the standard of care, the use of placebo, and post-trial obligations (§6.2), and, finally, the concept of vulnerability (§6.3).

6.1 The Position Against Research

There is a quite critical and pervasive trend, led mostly by Brazilian bioethicists, focused on a strong defense of the protection of research participants, and even a rejection of research, especially multicenter clinical trials. This trend includes a critical position against the international research system for being shaped by market needs, the search for profit and neoliberal policies (Cornejo Moreno & Gómez Arteaga 2012; de Freitas & Schlemper 2014; Garrafa et al. 2010; Ugalde & Homedes 2011; Kottow 2005, 2009; 2014, Páez 2015).

Regarding the need for greater protection, Miguel Kottow (2009) is critical of clinical trials and research ethics in general, pointing to the tension between clinical care and research. He criticizes the trend in clinical research ethics that often substitutes the ethics of patient care for the pursuit of knowledge (in his view, this may allow the recruitment of non-competent patients). He questions the prevailing methodological purity as well as the concept of clinical equipoise. This position goes against the majority of research ethics literature, which distinguishes between clinical care and research, and considers that the latter should strive to obtain generalizable knowledge. He also opposes the concept of the common good, denouncing a rhetorical and semantic shift that validates ethical transgressions by appealing to the common good (Kottow 2007). For these reasons, he strongly defends the inclusion of clinical care as a way to protect research participants.

This kind of critique has had an impact in the region. In Costa Rica, for example, clinical research on human subjects was banned by the Constitutional Chamber (Sala Constitucional) from 2010 until 2015, when a new law regulating biomedical research was passed and clinical research was reinstated. However, these years of inactivity have been detrimental for the country and for researchers (Householder et al. 2019).[7] Meanwhile, in Chile successive laws in 2012 and 2015 introduced stringent regulatory protections regarding research with people with cognitive impairment, compensation for research-related injuries, and post-trial access to treatments. These laws were followed by a decline in the number of clinical trials registered in the country and also caused concern in the local research community (Aguilera 2021).

A crucial actor in this picture is the pharmaceutical industry (PI). In relation to the practices of the PI, Homedes and Ugalde published a series of articles denouncing their unethical or controversial practices, describing cases and pointing out the advantages of doing clinical trials in Latin America (fast recruitment, lack of transparency, good researchers, etc.) (Ugalde & Homedes 2011; Homedes & Ugalde 2014b; 2015; 2016). They also argue that the PI prioritizes profits over public health, leading to high prices for essential medicines. This situation exacerbates health inequalities in Latin America, where a significant portion of the population cannot afford necessary treatments (Homedes & Ugalde 2015; Páez 2015). These critics also claim that the system of intellectual property rights and patents promoted by the PI keeps prices high and limits access to life-saving medicines.

In the same vein, Páez (2015) argues that the PI puts corporate profits ahead of the health needs of the population. For Páez, traditional theories of justice, such as those based on human rights, are insufficient to addressing the complexities of international research in low- and middle-income countries: a more context-sensitive approach to justice is needed. He considers the case of Mexico. He argues that justice in research should not only prevent harm, but also actively promote the well-being of vulnerable populations and ensure that the benefits of research are shared equitably. Páez’s book outlines specific obligations for each stakeholder, such as the state, the PI, health authorities, researchers, RECs, patients, and civil society, and emphasizes the need for a comprehensive approach that integrates social justice into research practices. This includes addressing the social determinants of health, ensuring access to the benefits of research, and respecting the dignity and rights of participants. With respect to the PI, he calls for reforming practices, ensuring fair compensation for the use of facilities and participants, addressing the 10/90 gap (where 90% of research resources are focused on diseases that affect only 10% of the world’s population), and sharing the benefits of research with host communities.

This debate presupposes the existence of exploitative practices. In the research ethics literature, exploitation is usually framed as a transaction-specific concept (Wertheimer 1996, 2011; Emanuel 2008), that is, as single and isolated exploitative events. This has led to the idea that sponsors—usually the PI or national research agencies from wealthy countries—are not responsible for addressing structural injustice. Against this view, it has been argued that structural injustice is important, because it makes exploitation more likely. This account makes it possible to extend the scope of moral responsibility to agents other than the exploiter, that is, to all agents who are responsible for (or able to remedy) structural injustice (Holzer 2020).

6.2 Standard of Care, Placebo Use and Post-Trial Obligations

Another area of debate is the international concern over changes of international ethical guidelines for research following the denunciation of the AZT perinatal transmission trials in sub-Saharan Africa. Since 2000, there have been criticisms of different versions of the Declaration of Helsinki (DoH 1964 [2024]) on the standard of care, the use of placebos, and post-trial obligations (Garrafa 2014; Kottow 2005, 2014; Luna 2001a, Luna and Salles 2008, chap. 11; Mastroleo 2016). Latin American bioethicists joined the global discussion and debate.

Double standards in research are at the center of the discussion. The phrase “double standards” refers to the practice of applying rigorous ethics for developed countries and pragmatic, relaxed standards for developing countries. Researchers may conduct research in countries with less oversight or regulation than in their home country. Double standards are emphatically rejected in Latin America as unethical and unacceptable (Kottow 2005; Ortiz-Millán 2021; Luna 2001a). An antecedent case that might explain the widespread rejection of double standards in Latin America is the Guatemala Syphilis experiment done during 1946 to 1948 by an American scientist on 5500 Guatemalans that were infected and enrolled in research without their consent (Löwy 2013; Zenilman 2013; Cuerda-Galindo et al. 2014).[8] A widely discussed case of potential research with double standards in the region was a placebo-controlled trial (PCT) led by Discovery Laboratories of Doylestown, Pennsylvania, to be conducted in Bolivia, Ecuador, Peru, and Mexico in the early 2000s. Discovery Lab wanted to test sinapultide (Surfaxin), a new drug for the treatment of idiopathic respiratory distress syndrome (RDS) in premature infants. The control group of 325 premature infants would receive a placebo instead of a life-saving surfactant drug approved by the United States Food and Drug Administration (FDA). Many newborns who would have received the placebo would have likely died unnecessarily. To get the full picture, it should be noted that the FDA approved four surfactants since 1990 (Lavery et al. 2007: 152). Meanwhile, the same company was proposing another project in Europe with an FDA-approved surfactant for the control group, i.e., without placebo. In addition, an internal FDA document stated that “conducting a placebo-controlled surfactant trial in premature infants with RDS is considered unethical in the US” (Lurie & Wolfe 2007: 160). Thus, there was a clear proposal for a double standard: one design for Latin American countries and another—respecting the FDA criterion—for Europe. This was denounced by Public Citizen, a Washington-based nonprofit consumer advocacy group. As a result, the trials were neither approved nor conducted.

Several ethical standards have been debated on the occasion of the rewriting of the DoH in 2000 and its clarifying notes to articles 29 and 30 in 2002, as well as with the modification of the CIOMS in 2002. Arguments regarding appropriate standards of care or comparators were presented against the proposal to introduce implicit economic clauses as comparators (Luna 2001a; Luna and Salles 2008: 385–7).

With regard to PCTs, international discussion has pointed to their need in three main cases: (a) when there is no treatment, (b) for methodological or compelling scientific reasons, and (c) in the case of minor diseases (e.g., those that may have a psychological component), when a placebo will not cause additional and serious or irreversible harm (CIOMS 2002; DoH 2002), or when delaying or withholding the intervention will result in no more than a small increase above minimal risk (CIOMS 2016). The first case is the standard and accepted one: as there is no treatment to compare with, placebo is justified. The second is problematic. Defenders of PCTs claim that the methodological clause alone is sufficient (researchers should just follow scientific reasoning), while moderate positions argue that both (b) and (c) are needed. The methodological clause alone is not sufficient because no serious harm to research participants should be accepted. Therefore, clause (c) is fundamental. Luna argues against the changes introduced in the DoH in 2001 (Note of Clarification to §29). She explains that the new formulation combines clauses (b) and (c) with a disjunction “or” and argues that both conditions should be met, so a conjunction “and” should be used (Luna and Salles 2008: 387).

Recently, the issue came to the fore again in the context of research into vaccines for COVID-19 to be conducted in low- and middle-income countries. The discussion was whether trials could be conducted against placebo, or whether vaccines already in use were the appropriate comparator. Ortiz-Millán (2021) argued against PCTs as they are against the best interest of the participants. In addition to the economic and social reasons traditionally used to justify PCTs (they are cheaper, shorter, or feasible in countries with lax regulations), he pointed out that they expose research subjects to excessive risks. COVID—at the time of the pandemic—was a life-threatening disease, and alternative vaccines, although only licensed for emergency use, had high levels of efficacy and safety and were already available in developed countries. He cited ethical guidelines that at the time allowed only minimal risks and excluded serious or irreversible harm. Finally, he admitted that if only Pfizer/BioNtech vaccines had been available, PCTs could have been justified given the logistical conditions (they must be kept at −70º and in many countries or regions this is not feasible) (Ortiz-Millán 2021: 3). This is a relevant argument, since one of the situations invoked for the use of PCTs had to do with the context and the usefulness of the research for the population participating in it.

Another discussion concerns post-trial benefits, that is, access to beneficial treatments after a clinical trial has been completed. The position of Páez (2015) on the provision of post-trial benefits has already been mentioned. In addition to analyzing different formulations of this clause, Mastroleo (2014) proposes a normative model based on social and distributive justice, drawing on Rawls’ A Theory of Justice. He defends the obligation of continuity of beneficial treatment from the right to health and the principle of equal opportunity (Mastroleo 2016). He provides a robust and ethically sound approach to post-treatment obligations based on the principles of democratic reciprocity and social justice.

6.3 Vulnerability

Most authors who take a strongly protective stance towards participants emphasize the vulnerability of people in Latin America. For Garrafa (2014), social vulnerability is characterized by low income, limited access to education and technology, and social exclusion. For him, this raises ethical concerns about their ability to give informed consent and the potential for exploitation. Kottow (2009) also refers to vulnerability and the inability of participants to give adequate informed consent when participating in research.

In the region, the concept of vulnerability has been explored in depth by Luna (2009, 2019a, 2019b). Her concept has had a strong influence on global literature and feminist thought, and on ethical guidelines such as CIOMS (2016; see van Delden and van der Graaf 2017) and DoH (2024). To understand how this concept works, she proposes the metaphor of layered vulnerabilities. Multiple and different layers of vulnerability can be acquired, overlapped, and removed one at a time. There is no “solid and unique vulnerability” that exhausts the category (Luna 2009). Luna rejects as problematic the concept of “vulnerable populations”, which can be exemplified by the traditional account as well as by Garrafa and Kottow’s conceptions. This subpopulation approach treats vulnerability as a label attached to a particular population, fixing its content and stigmatizing it (Luna 2009). Instead, for Luna,

1) no single standard exists and there are multiple factors or sources of vulnerability; 2) they are deeply related to the context; and 3) vulnerability is not an essential property of the research participants or groups per se. (Luna 2019a: 88)

She goes on to explain that layers of vulnerability are dispositional properties. Thus, these properties are “latent” until a stimulus condition triggers them. Although Kottow (2012) does not explore the structure of the concept, he also points out the difference between “vulnerability” (potential harm) and “vulneration” (actual harm). And he says that conflating these concepts has led to the mistaken belief that vulnerable people are inherently incapable of protecting their own interests. For Luna, understanding and acknowledging the functioning and dispositional structure of vulnerability is relevant to assessing this concept. Research ethics committees should identify these triggers in order to conduct thorough assessments (Luna 2019b). Another important feature she points out is that some layers can have a cascading effect. They can create new vulnerabilities or exacerbate existing ones with very damaging effects. This should also be identified by RECs, as the cascade effect is relevant for the evaluation of a research protocol (Luna 2019b). In Luna’s view, not only should safeguards and protections be implemented, but research participants should also be empowered. An advantage of this view is that it is compatible with different definitions of vulnerability, such as the lack of power and the possibility of exploitation (Zion, Gillam, & Loff 2000), the inability of research subjects to protect their interests (CIOMS 2002), or vulnerability based on risk, wrongs and harm (Hurst 2008), among others.

7. Autonomy, Illiteracy and Informed Consent

As noted above, many Latin American bioethicists are concerned about the prevalence of vulnerability in the region. Not only do people suffer from lack of economic resources, social exclusion, lack of access to technology, etc., but also from low levels of education and high levels of illiteracy. Vulnerabilities in general, and literacy and education in particular, are relevant to decision making because they can jeopardize autonomy, voluntariness, and competence, as well as valid informed consent. As mentioned above, some authors in research ethics claim that informed consent (IC) is useless on this basis. And in the 90s there were debates in the region regarding the acceptance of autonomy as a relevant value for research participants and patients.

7.1 Informed Consent and Research

Several articles have been written about the forms used for IC in research, especially the fact that many participants have no alternative means of treatment other than those offered by clinical trials. Verástegui (2006) conducted an evaluation of IC at a major cancer center in Mexico. Although the sample is small, it reflects a common situation in the region. Her results show that

Eighty three percent of the patients in the study were classified as living in poverty; education level was poor or non existent, and 31% of the patients were illiterate. The consent forms were difficult to understand according to 49% of the patients, most doctors agreed that the forms were not comprehensible to the patients. (Verástegui 2006: abstract)

She also adds that the average length of the IC documents was 14 pages, and the readability average score was equivalent to eighth grade.

This analysis leads to at least two alternatives: (a) absolute rejection or opposition to research with human subjects (as mentioned, the position of several critics of research, such as Kottow [2009] and Garrafa [2014]); (b) caution and care and, in addition, the provision of various safeguards when recruiting participants. In this second, more nuanced, line, Luna distinguishes different aspects of IC: the first has to do with epistemic conditions, that is, the capacity to understand information adequately; the second has to do with agency, that is, freedom and the capacity to be truly voluntary (Luna 2008a). The latter is related to the background conditions in which IC is given. While relatively good solutions can be found for the first aspect of IC (e.g., use of videos, tests to assess whether the key points have been understood, social workers, one-on-one communication, etc.), the second aspect may be more difficult to resolve (Luna 2008a: 44–45). When there is no reasonable alternative, accepting a burdensome choice, such as participating in research, cannot be considered a free choice, because not choosing it would have meant greater harm or burden to the agent. She also considers how IC analysis reflects a certain conception of a research participant. This conception is reductionist and implies an oversimplified and idealized view of the research participant that focuses only on autonomy. Considering only the deliberative factor, the process of IC can be equated to the signing of a contract and the research participant to a contractor, i.e., an idealized agent acting in a vacuum. She points out that people with vulnerabilities or scarce resources are potential victims, but have not actually been harmed or coerced. Therefore, it is necessary to think about adequate protections. Luna proposes a mixed model: this is one that respects the role of research participant as contractors, but also takes into account their potential to be victims. The concept of research participant should reflect these two conceptualizations (Luna 2008a: 48–49).

7.2 Informed Consent in Clinical Practice

The use of IC in clinical settings presents similar problems of understanding and has also been considered by Latin American bioethicists (Escobar López & Novoa Torres 2016; Cerdán et al. 2014; Álvarez Díaz 2012b; Costa 2008; Mocellin Raymundo 2013). When bioethical discussions started in the region there were many challenges regarding the acceptance of informed consent and patient autonomy.

There was a tendency to question the applicability of the concept of autonomy to individuals in the region. Arleen Salles characterizes this tendency as grounded in the belief that the notion of autonomy is overly influenced by American and Eurocentric values, making it unsuitable for the Latin American medical context (Salles 2002). Salles critically examines this perspective highlighting the cultural assumptions underlying it. She argues that this position is based on a misinterpretation of the nature and role of autonomy, as well as a reductive and simplistic view of Latin Americans and their values. Moreover, she notes that the argument is not only flawed, but potentially dangerous, as it promotes the idea that cultural traditions are immune to rational criticism. In a separate article, Salles (2004) calls for adopting a human rights paradigm to define the boundaries of morally legitimate cultural practices. For Salles, while cultural diversity should be recognized and protected, it is essential to ensure that it does not become oppressive or disempowering. This is why she emphasizes that respect for individuals and their rights should be given priority. Costa (1996) also defends the importance of the autonomy principle and criticizes the approach of the popular principlist theory of Beauchamp and Childress (1979). She disputes not only the justification of the theory, but also the application of this principle when it conflicts with other prima facie principles, and proposes an alternative.

Another pervasive argument has been that illiterate people are uneducated, lack information and understanding, and are incapable of making decisions. Therefore, paternalism is justified in their case, since illiterate people cannot be autonomous. Luna argues against this paternalistic view and points that this argument relies on an a priori attitude based on (a) facts: the number of illiterate people, and (b) values: a disregard of the principle of autonomy with the argument that it is “foreign” and cannot be applied in countries where illiteracy is widespread. After considering various assumptions, she points out that it is easier to assume that illiterate people are similar to incompetent, and not bother trying to find out whether they really cannot understand. An illiterate person requires more time to explain and more effort to adapt technical medical language to simple and clear speech. It requires extra time and effort that the illiterate person usually cannot pay for due to lack of resources. These problems are of a social and economic nature, and although they may be relevant, they are not sufficient to deny competence and understanding to the illiterate. Thus, in these cases, there does not seem to be an adequate ethical justification for denying them the opportunity to make decisions (Luna 2001b).

Another point worth considering in the recent literature is that the traditional concept of autonomy is often used as a counterpoint to vulnerability (Álvarez Medina 2022). For example, according to some interpretations, if a person is not autonomous, he or she is vulnerable (Fineman 2010). This happens when vulnerability is associated with the loss of certain intellectual capacities or with problems related to them. Thus, the traditional “obstacles to autonomy” (non-rationality, mental pathology, ignorance) are assumed to reveal vulnerability.[9]

8. Other topics

In addition to the topics reviewed in this entry, Latin American bioethicists address several other important issues that reflect the region’s unique cultural, social, and economic contexts. Due to space limitations, many of these issues have not been included in this entry. Some of these issues include disability rights and access to health care for people with disabilities. As migration flows increase, bioethicists are also examining the right of migrants to health care and the impact of border policies. The ethics of emerging biotechnologies such as gene editing and neuroethics are also prominent, focusing on issues such as privacy, consent, and unequal access. The ethics of mental health care are growing areas of concern. Environmental ethics is another critical area of study, particularly in relation to deforestation, biodiversity loss, and climate change. Animal ethics is increasingly addressed, with bioethicists advocating for stronger animal welfare laws and the ethical treatment of animals in various settings, such as scientific research, agriculture, and entertainment—often arguing for their outright abolition. These issues reflect the broader social, cultural, and environmental challenges facing Latin America and show how bioethicists in the region are addressing complex ethical questions that go beyond traditional biomedical issues.

Bibliography

  • Aguayo Westwood, Pablo, 2020, “Lo realmente importante no es vivir, sino vivir bien. Una discusión sobre eutanasia, autonomía y autorrespeto”, Acta bioethica, 26(1): 9–16. doi:10.4067/S1726-569X2020000100009
  • Aguilera, Bernardo, 2020, “Ethical Allocation of Scarce Health Care Resources in the Context of the COVID-19 Crisis”, Medwave, 20(05): e7935. doi:10.5867/medwave.2020.05.7935
  • –––, 2021, “Trends in Clinical Trials Performed in Chile”, Revista Médica de Chile, 149(1): 110–118. doi:10.4067/S0034-98872021000100110
  • Alegre, Marcelo, 2019, “Conscious Oppression: Conscientious Objection in the Sphere of Sexual and Reproductive Health”, in Rivera-López and Hevia 2019: 33–51. doi:10.1007/978-3-030-17963-2_3
  • Álvarez del Río, Asunción, 2013, “El derecho a decidir: eutanasia y suicidio asistido”, Cirujano General, 35(supl. 2): S115–S118.
  • Álvarez Gálvez, Íñigo, 2013, “Sobre el argumento de la pendiente resbaladiza en la eutanasia”, Dilemata, 11: 83–111.
  • Álvarez Medina, Silvina, 2022, “La ilusión de autonomía plena”, in Autonomía y feminismos, Mercedes Cavallo and Agustina Ramón Michel (eds), Buenos Aires: ediciones Didot, 11–24.
  • Álvarez Díaz, Jorge Alberto, 2012a, “¿Bioética latinoamericana o bioética en Latinoamérica?”, Revista Latinoamericana de Bioética, 12(22): 10–27. doi:10.18359/rlbi.989
  • –––, 2012b, “Legibilidad de los formularios de educación y consentimiento en procedimientos de reproducción asistida de la Red Latinoamericana de Reproducción Asistida”, Cirugía y Cirujanos, 80(2): 162–170.
  • Aurenque, Diana, Ruth Marcela Espinosa, Juan Alberto Lecaros, Daniel Loewe, and Raúl Villarroel, 2021, “Ethical-Medical Orientations for the Attention of Critical Patients in the COVID-19 Pandemic Context”, Ramon Llull Journal of Applied Ethics, 12: 195–206. doi:10.34810/RLJAEV1N12ID389311
  • Banti, Enrique Numa, 2020, “¿Cuál es la duda?: el comienzo de la vida humana: mirada desde la biología y de la bioética personalista ontológica”, Vida y Ética, 21(1): 10–31. [Banti 2020 available online]
  • Beauchamp, Tom L. and James F. Childress, 1979, Principles of Biomedical Ethics, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Bellucci, Mabel, 2014, Historia de una desobediencia: aborto y feminismo, Buenos Aires: Capital Intelectual.
  • Bertomeu, Maria Julia and Graciela Vidiella, 2002, “Moral Person and the Right to Health Care”, in Salles and Bertomeu 2002: 107–121 (ch. 6).
  • Blázquez Graf, Norma, Itzel Cadena Alvear, and Ana Celia Chapa Romero, 2022, “Debates feministas en torno a la reproducción asistida”, Inter Disciplina, 10(28): 273–300. doi:10.22201/ceiich.24485705e.2022.28.83299
  • Bonilla, Patricia, 2021, “Cuidados paliativos en Latinoamérica”, Revista de Nutrición Clínica y Metabolismo, 4(2): 4–13. doi:10.35454/rncm.v4n2.226
  • Buedo, Paola and Florencia Luna, 2021, “Toma de decisiones compartidas en salud mental: una propuesta novedosa”, Medicina y Ética, 32(4): 1087–1011. doi:10.36105/mye.2021v32n4.05
  • Busdygan, Daniel, 2013, Sobre la despenalización del aborto (Biblioteca crítica de feminismos género), La Plata, Argentina: Universidad Nacional de La Plata.
  • Cabrera Cabrera, Antonio, Alejandro Sánchez Guerrero, David Cerdio Domínguez, and María Victoria Fernández Molina, 2024, “Desarrollo institucional de la bioética en Iberoamérica: resultados preliminares del Atlas Iberoamericano de bioética”, Medicina y Ética, 35(2): 484–536. doi:10.36105/mye.2024v35n2.05
  • Capdevielle, Pauline, 2015, La libertad de conciencia frente al estado laico (Serie Cultura Laica, núm. 5), México, D.F: Universidad Nacional Autónoma de México, Instituto de Investigaciones Jurídicas.
  • Capdevielle, Pauline and Fernando Arlettaz, 2019, “Laicidad y principio de autonomía. Una mirada desde los derechos sexuales y reproductivos”, in Libres e iguales: estudios sobre autonomía, género y religión (Serie Doctrina Jurídica, núm. 845), Marcelo Alegre (ed.), Mexico City: Universidad Nacional Autónoma de México, 149–172.
  • Casas Martínez, María de la Luz, Marcela Chavarria Olarte, Francisco Javier León Correa, María Emilia Montejano Milton, and Francisco Vásquez Gómez Bisogno, 2009, Bioética y aborto: hacia una cultura de la vida, México: Trillas.
  • Casas-Martínez, María de la Luz and Ignacio Mora-Magaña, 2017, “¿La sedación paliativa acorta la vida de los pacientes?”, Persona y Bioética, 21(2): 204–218. doi:10.5294/pebi.2017.21.2.2
  • Cavazos, Nora, D. Forster, Otto Orive, Gustavo Kaltwasser, and A. J. Bowen, 2002, “The Cultural Framework for the Ethical Review of Clinical Research in Latin America”, Drug Information Journal, 36(4): 727–737. doi:10.1177/009286150203600402
  • Cerdán, Alonso, Alejandro González-Arreola, and Emma Verástegui, 2014, “Who Decides? Informed Consent for Cancer Patients in Mexico”, in Homedes and Ugalde 2014a: 237–249. doi:10.1007/978-3-319-01363-3_11
  • CIOMS (Council for International Organizations of Medical Sciences) in collaboration with the World Health Organization (WHO), 2002, International Ethical Guidelines for Biomedical Research Involving Human Subjects, Geneva: World Health Organization.
  • –––, 2016, International Ethical Guidelines for Health-Related Research Involving Humans, Geneva: World Health Organization. Replaces CIOMS 2002.
  • Cisne, Mirla, Viviane Vaz Castro, and Giulia Maria Jenelle Cavalcante de Oliveira, 2018, “Unsafe Abortion: A Patriarchal and Racialized Picture of Women’s Poverty”, Revista Katálysis, 21(3): 452–470. doi:10.1590/1982-02592018v21n3p452
  • Colombo, Roberto, 1999, “La naturaleza y el estatuto del embrión humano”, Revista Humanitas, 4(16): 596–599.
  • Cornejo Moreno, Borys Alberto and Gress Marissell Gómez Arteaga, 2012, “Violation of Ethical Principles in Clinical Research. Influences and Possible Solutions for Latin America”, BMC Medical Ethics, 13(1): article 35. doi:10.1186/1472-6939-13-35
  • Correa, Marilena and Ilana Löwy, 2020, “Reproductive Technology and Social Justice: A View from Brazil”, Reproductive BioMedicine Online, 41(6): 1151–1153. doi:10.1016/j.rbmo.2020.11.003
  • Costa, María Victoria, 1996, “El concepto de autonomía en la ética médica: problemas de fundamentación y aplicación”, Perspectivas Bioéticas en las Américas, 1(2): 89–116.
  • –––, 2008, “El manejo de la información médica: el consentimiento informado y la confidencialidad”, in Luna and Salles 2008: 165–196.
  • Cuerda-Galindo, E., X. Sierra-Valenti, E. González-López, and F. López-Muñoz, 2014, “Syphilis and Human Experimentation From World War II to the Present: A Historical Perspective and Reflections on Ethics”, Actas Dermo-Sifiliográficas (English Edition), 105(9): 847–853. doi:10.1016/j.adengl.2013.08.003
  • de Araujo, Marcelo, 2013, “Eutanásia, ortotanásia, e suicídio assistido: a ética do respeito à dignidade e à autonomia de pacientes em estágio terminal”, Ethic@ – An International Journal for Moral Philosophy, 12(1): 15–24. doi:10.5007/1677-2954.2013v12n1p15
  • De Freitas, Corina Bontempo Duca and Bruno R. Schlemper, 2014, “Progress and Challenges of Clinical Research with New Medications in Brazil”, in Homedes and Ugalde 2014a: 151–171. doi:10.1007/978-3-319-01363-3_7
  • Dias, Maria Clara (ed.), 2019, Perspectiva dos Funcionamentos: fundamentos teóricos e aplicações, Rio de Janeiro: Ape’ku.
  • Dias, Maria Clara and Fabio A. G. Oliveira, 2023, “Pandemic and Structural Comorbidity: Lasting Social Injustices in Brazil”, in Pandemic Ethics: From COVID-19 to Disease X, Julian Savulescu and Dominic Wilkinson (eds), New York: Oxford University Press, 318–336 (ch. 15). doi:10.1093/oso/9780192871688.003.0016
  • Díaz Amado, Eduardo, 2017, “La despenalización de la eutanasia en Colombia: contexto, bases y críticas”, Revista de Bioética y Derecho, 40: 125–140. doi:10.1344/rbd2017.40.19167
  • Dieterlen, Paulette, 2014, Justicia distributiva y salud, Mexico City: Universidad Nacional Autónoma de México/Fondo de Cultura Económica.
  • Diniz, Debora, 2011, “Objeção de consciência e aborto: direitos e deveres dos médicos na saúde pública”, Revista de Saúde Pública, 45(5): 981–985. doi:10.1590/S0034-89102011005000047
  • –––, 2016 [2017], Zika: do sertão nordestino à ameaça global, Rio de Janeiro: Civilização Brasileira. Translated as Zika: From the Brazilian Backlands to Global Threat, Diane R. Grosklaus Whitty (trans.), London: Zed Books.
  • Diniz, Debora and Dirce Guilhem, 2008, “Bioética feminista na América Latina: a contribuição das mulheres”, Estudos Feministas, 16(2): 599–612. doi:10.1590/S0104-026X2008000200015
  • Diniz, Debora, Marilena Corrêa, Flávia Squinca, and Kátia Soares Braga, 2009, “Aborto: 20 anos de pesquisas no Brasil”, Cadernos de Saúde Pública, 25(4): 939–942. doi:10.1590/S0102-311X2009000400025
  • [DoH 1964–2024], WMA Declaration of Helsinki – Ethical Principles for Medical Research Involving Human Participants, World Medical Association, adopted 1964 latest revision 2024. [Declaration of Helsinki 1964 [2024] available online]
  • [DoH 2002] Declaration of Helsinki: Note of Clarification on Placebo-Controlled Trials, 2002, Edinburgh: World Medical Association. [ Declaration of Helsinki 2002 available online]
  • Echemendía Tocabens, Belkis, 2014, “La regulación ética de las investigaciones biomédicas y los comités de ética de la investigación”, Revista Cubana de Higiene y Epidemiología, 52(1): 120–142.
  • The Economist, 2023, “Evangelicals May Soon Rival Catholics in Latin America”, The Economist, 8 April 2023. [The Economist 2023 available online]
  • Emanuel, Ezekiel J., 2008, “Addressing Exploitation: Reasonable Availability versus Fair Benefits”, in Exploitation and Developing Countries: The Ethics of Clinical Research, Jennifer Susan Hawkins and Ezekiel J. Emanuel (eds), Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 286–313 (ch. 9).
  • Escobar López, María Teresa and Edgar Novoa Torres, 2016, “Análisis de formatos de consentimiento informado en Colombia. Problemas ético-legales y dificultades en el lenguaje”, Revista Latinoamericana de Bioética, 16(30–1): 14–37. doi:10.18359/rlbi.1439
  • Espejo-Yaksic, Nicolás, Claire Fenton-Glynn, and Jens M. Scherpe (eds), 2023, Surrogacy in Latin America, first edition, Cambridge/Antwerp: Intersentia Ltd. doi:10.1017/9781839703812
  • Espinoza, Eleonora, Jackeline Alger, Denis Padgett, and Mauricio Gonzales, 2011, “Comité de Ética en Investigación Biomédica (CEIB) de la Facultad de Ciencias Médicas, Universidad Nacional Autónoma de Honduras: Experiencia 2000–2010”, Revista Médica Hondureña, 79(2): 98–102.
  • Esquivel, Juan Cruz and Gabriela Irrazábal, 2021, “End-of-Life Decision-Making and Religious Beliefs: Opinions and Attitudes towards Death and Euthanasia in Argentina”, Revista Latinoamericana de Bioética, 21(1): 77–98. doi:10.18359/rlbi.5125
  • Felitti, Karina and Sol Prieto, 2018, “Configuraciones de la laicidad en los debates por la legalización del aborto en la Argentina: discursos parlamentarios y feministas (2015–2018)”, Salud Colectiva, 14(3): 405–423. doi:10.18294/sc.2018.2027
  • Fineman, Martha, 2010, “The Vulnerable Subject and the Responsive State”, Emory Law Journal, 60(2): 251–275.
  • Gamboa-Bernal, Gilberto A., 2017, “Itinerario de la eutanasia en Colombia. Veinte años después”, Persona y Bioética, 21(2): 197–203. doi:10.5294/pebi.2017.21.2.1
  • García Pereáñez, José Antonio, 2016, “Consideraciones del bioderecho sobre la eutanasia en Colombia”, Revista Latinoamericana de Bioética, 17(32–1): 200–221. doi:10.18359/rlbi.2637
  • Garcia, Lucas F., Marcia S. Fernandes, Jonathan D. Moreno, and Jose R. Goldim, 2019, “Mapping Bioethics in Latin America: History, Theoretical Models, and Scientific Output”, Journal of Bioethical Inquiry, 16(3): 323–331. doi:10.1007/s11673-019-09903-7
  • Garrafa, Volnei, 2014, “Declaración de Helsinki y sus repetidos ‘ajustes’ – un tema fatigoso…”, Revista Lasallista de Investigación, 11(1): 35–40. doi:10.22507/rli.v11n1a3
  • Garrafa, Volnei, Jan Helge Solbakk, Susana Vidal, and Claudio Lorenzo, 2010, “Between the Needy and the Greedy: The Quest for a Just and Fair Ethics of Clinical Research”, Journal of Medical Ethics, 36(8): 500–504. doi:10.1136/jme.2009.032656
  • Gudiño Bessone, Pablo, 2018, “Aborto, sexualidad y bioética en documentos y encíclicas vaticanas”, Acta bioethica, 24(1): 85–94. doi:10.4067/S1726-569X2018000100085
  • Guerra López, Rodrigo, 2003, Afirmar a la persona por sí misma: la dignidad como fundamento de los derechos de la persona, México: Comisión Nacional de los Derechos Humanos.
  • Gutiérrez Martínez, Daniel and Marcia Mocellin Raymundo, 2018, “Desafíos de la bioética y la laicidad: avatares entre ética y diversidad”, in Bioética laica: vida, muerte, género, reproducción y familia, Pauline Capdevielle and María de Jesús Medina Arellano (eds), México: Instituto de Investigaciones Jurídicas, Universidad Nacional Autónoma de México, 33–60.
  • Guttmacher Institute, 2018, Fact Sheet: Abortion in Latin America and the Caribbean.
  • Hevia, Martin, 2019, “The Legal Status of Surrogacy in Latin America”, in Rivera-López and Hevia 2019: 53–63. doi:10.1007/978-3-030-17963-2_4
  • Higuita Jaramillo, Simón and Natalia Eugenia Gómez Rúa, 2023, “Gestación subrogada: un análisis de la regulación en algunos países de américa latina”, Estudios Socio-Jurídicos, 25(2): 28 pages. doi:10.12804/revistas.urosario.edu.co/sociojuridicos/a.12781
  • Holzer, Felicitas, 2020, “Bridging Exploitation and Structural Injustice: The Example of Clinical Research”, Revista Latinoamericana de Filosofía Política, 9(3): 42–67.
  • Holzer, Felicitas, Tania Manríquez Roa, Federico Germani, Nikola Biller‐Andorno, and Florencia Luna, 2023, “Charity or Empowerment? The Role of COVAX for Low and Middle‐income Countries”, Developing World Bioethics, 23(1): 59–66. doi:10.1111/dewb.12349
  • Homedes, Nuria and Antonio Ugalde (eds), 2014a, Clinical Trials in Latin America: Where Ethics and Business Clash (Research Ethics Forum 2), Cham: Springer. doi:10.1007/978-3-319-01363-3
  • –––, 2014b, “Problemas éticos de los ensayos clínicos en América Latina”, Revista Redbioética/UNESCO, 2(10): 51–63.
  • –––, 2015, “Availability and Affordability of New Medicines in Latin American Countries Where Pivotal Clinical Trials Were Conducted”, Bulletin of the World Health Organization, 93(10): 674–683. doi:10.2471/BLT.14.151290
  • –––, 2016, “Ensayos clínicos en América Latina: implicancias para la sustentabilidad y seguridad de los mercados farmacéuticos y el bienestar de los sujetos”, Salud Colectiva, 12(3): 317–345. doi:10.18294/sc.2016.1073
  • Householder, Michael, Ana Laura Solano‐López, Derby Muñóz‐Rojas, and Suzanne M. Rivera, 2019, “Reviving Human Research in Costa Rica”, Ethics & Human Research, 41(1): 32–40. doi:10.1002/eahr.500004
  • Hurst, Samia A., 2008, “Vulnerability in Research and Health Care; Describing the Elephant in the Room?”, Bioethics, 22(4): 191–202. doi:10.1111/j.1467-8519.2008.00631.x
  • IACHR (Inter-American Court of Human Rights), 2012, Case of Artavia Murillo et al. (“In Vitro Fertilization”) v. Costa Rica. Judgment of 28 November 2012. [IACHR 2012 available online (pdf)].
  • Kottow, Miguel [Michael] H., 2005, “Conflictos en ética de investigación con seres humanos”, Cadernos de Saúde Pública, 21(3): 862–869. doi:10.1590/S0102-311X2005000300020
  • –––, 2007, “Tensiones retóricas y semánticas en ética de la investigación”, Cadernos de Saúde Pública, 23(10): 2396–2402. doi:10.1590/S0102-311X2007001000014
  • –––, 2009, “Clinical and Research Ethics as Moral Strangers”, Archivum Immunologiae et Therapiae Experimentalis, 57(3): 157–164. doi:10.1007/s00005-009-0027-8
  • –––, 2012, “Vulnerabilidad entre derechos humanos y bioética. Relaciones tormentosas, conflictos insolutos”, Derecho PUCP, 69: 25–44. doi:10.18800/derechopucp.201202.001
  • –––, 2014, “De Helsinki a Fortaleza: una Declaración desangrada”, Revista Bioética, 22(1): 28–33.
  • Lamas, Marta, 2007, “El laicismo y los derechos sexuales y reproductivos”, in Laicidad: una asignatura pendiente (Filosofía y cultura contemporánea 33), Rodolfo Vázquez (ed.), Mexico City: Ediciones Coyoacán, 125–142.
  • Lamm, Eleonora, 2012, “El desarrollo de la Bioética en América Latina: una visión desde Argentina”, in Cuestiones de bioética en y desde Latinoamérica, María Casado and Florencia Luna (eds), Cizur Menor: Civitas, 101–123.
  • Lavery, James V., Christine Grady, Elizabeth R. Wahl, and Ezekiel J. Emanuel (eds), 2007, Ethical Issues in International Biomedical Research: A Casebook, New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/oso/9780195179224.001.0001
  • Lerner, Susana, Agnès Guillaume, and Lucía Melgar, 2016, Realidades y falacias en torno al aborto. Salud y derechos humanos, Mexico City: El Colegio de México/Institut de Recherche pour le Développement.
  • Linares Salgado, Jorge Enrique, 2022, “La controversia bioética sobre el triaje durante la pandemia de la COVID-19”, Revista de Bioética y Derecho, 56: 163–182. doi:10.1344/rbd2022.56.38674
  • Loewe, Daniel, 2020, Ética y coronavirus (Sección de obras de filosofía), Santiago de Chile: Fondo de Cultura Económica.
  • Lolas Stepke, Fernando, 2005, “Rehistoriar la bioética en Latinoamérica: La contribución de James Drane”, Acta bioethica, 11(2): 161–167. doi:10.4067/S1726-569X2005000200006
  • Löwy, Ilana, 2013, “The Best Possible Intentions Testing Prophylactic Approaches on Humans in Developing Countries”, American Journal of Public Health, 103(2): 226–237. doi:10.2105/AJPH.2012.300901
  • Luna, Florencia, 2001a, “Is ‘Best Proven’ A Useless Criterion?”, Bioethics, 15(4): 273–288. doi:10.1111/1467-8519.00239
  • –––, 2001b, Ensayos de bioética: reflexiones desde el sur, Mexico City: Fontamara. Translated as Bioethics and Vulnerability: A Latin American View (Value Inquiry Book Series 180), Peter Herissone-Kelly (ed.), Laura Pakter (trans.), Amsterdam/New York: Rodopi, 2006.
  • –––, 2008a, “Informed Consent: Still a Useful Tool in Research Ethics”, RECIIS, 2(Sup. 1): 41–51. doi:10.3395/reciis.v2.Sup1.208en
  • –––, 2008b, Reproducción asistida, género y derechos humanos en América Latina (Instituto Interamericano de Derechos Humanos, t. 4), San José, Costa Rica: Instituto Interamericano de Derechos Humanos.
  • –––, 2009, “Elucidating the Concept of Vulnerability: Layers Not Labels”, International Journal of Feminist Approaches to Bioethics, 2(1): 121–139. doi:10.3138/ijfab.2.1.121
  • –––, 2011, “Vulnerabilidad: un concepto muy útil, abandonando los ‘corsets teóricos’: respuesta a: Vulnerabilidad: ¿un principio fútil o útil en la ética de la asistencia sanitaria?”, Revista Redbioética/UNESCO, 2(4): 85–90.
  • –––, 2017, “Public Health Agencies’ Obligations and the Case of Zika”, Bioethics, 31(8): 575–581. doi:10.1111/bioe.12388
  • –––, 2019a, “Identifying and Evaluating Layers of Vulnerability – a Way Forward”, Developing World Bioethics, 19(2): 86–95. doi:10.1111/dewb.12206
  • –––, 2019b, “Revisiting Vulnerability: Its Development and Impact”, in Rivera-López and Hevia 2019: 67–81. doi:10.1007/978-3-030-17963-2_5
  • Luna, Florencia and Arleen L. F. Salles, 2008, Bioética: nuevas reflexiones sobre debates clásicos (Sección de obras de filosofía), Buenos Aires: Fondo de Cultura Económica.
  • Luna, Florencia and Johannes J. M. van Delden, 2004, “Is Physician-Assisted Death Only for Developed Countries? Latin America as a Case Study”, Journal of Palliative Care, 20(3): 155–162. doi:10.1177/082585970402000307
  • Luna, Florencia and Allison B. Wolf, 2014, “Challenges for Assisted Reproduction and Secondary Infertility in Latin America”, International Journal of Feminist Approaches to Bioethics, 7(1): 3–27. doi:10.3138/ijfab.7.1.3
  • Lurie, Peter and Sidney M. Wolfe, 2007, “The Developing World as the ‘Answer’ to the Dreams of Pharmaceutical Companies: The Surfaxin Story”, in Lavery, Grady, Wahl, and Emanuel 2007: 159–170 (Commentary 9.2).
  • Machado Martins, Luiz Oscar, Marcio Fernandes dos Reis, Alfredo Chaoubah, and Guilhermina Rego, 2023, “Equity in Health and Justice: A Look at the Brazilian Unified Health System (SUS) from the Perspective of John Rawls”, Acta Bioethica, 29(2): 165–175. doi:10.4067/S1726-569X2023000200165
  • Maffía, Diana and Patricia L. Gómez, 2019, “Apuntes feministas acerca de la gestación subrogada”, Derecho de Familia. Revista Interdisciplinaria de Doctrina y Jurisprudencia, 89: 167–173.
  • Mainetti, José Alberto, 2010, “The Discourses of Bioethics in Latin America”, in Pessini, Barchifontaine, and Lolas Stepke 2010: 21–27. doi:10.1007/978-1-4020-9350-0_2
  • Manrique de Lara, Amaranta and María de Jesús Medina Arellano, 2020, “The COVID-19 Pandemic and Ethics in Mexico Through a Gender Lens”, Journal of Bioethical Inquiry, 17(4): 613–617. doi:10.1007/s11673-020-10029-4
  • Manrique de Lara, Amaranta and Nashieli Ramírez Hernández, 2021, “Niñas, niños y adolescentes en pandemia”, in Ortiz Millán and Medina Arellano 2021: 145–160. doi:10.22201/iij.9786073048880e.2021.c8
  • Marcó Bach, Francisco Javier, 2022, “Algunos problemas de la objeción de conciencia” (“Some Problems of Conscientius Objection”), Medicina y Ética, 33(3): 771–804 (Spanish) 805–835 (English). doi:10.36105/mye.2022v33n3.04
  • Mastroleo, Ignacio, 2014, “Consideraciones sobre las obligaciones posinvestigación en la Declaración de Helsinki 2013”, Revista de Bioética y Derecho, 31: 51–65. doi:10.1344/rbd2014.31.10438
  • –––, 2016, “Post‐trial Obligations in the Declaration of Helsinki 2013: Classification, Reconstruction and Interpretation”, Developing World Bioethics, 16(2): 80–90. doi:10.1111/dewb.12099
  • Mastroleo, Ignacio and Alahí Bianchini, 2021, “Conducta responsable en la investigación científica”, in Ensayos sobre ética de la salud, Jorge Alberto Álvarez Díaz and Sergio López Moreno (eds), Mexico City: Universidad Autónoma Metropolitana, 399–420.
  • Mayans Hermida, Itzel, 2019, La controversia del aborto desde la perspectiva de la razón pública, Ciudad de México: Universidad Autónoma de la Ciudad de México (UACM).
  • Medina-Arellano, María de Jesús, Gloria Vargas Romero, Iris González Cortez, Araceli González Saavedra, and María Adriana Fuentes Manzo (eds.), 2023, Justicia sexual y reproductiva: diálogos plurales desde el feminismo, Ciudad de México: Instituto de Investigaciones Jurídicas, Universidad Nacional Autónoma de México (UNAM).
  • Meihack Miller, William, Lindsay Buckingham, Mario Salvador Sánchez-Domínguez, Sonia Morales-Miranda, and Gabriela Paz-Bailey, 2013, “Systematic Review of HIV Prevalence Studies among Key Populations in Latin America and the Caribbean”, Salud Pública de México, 55(suplemento 1): S65–S78. doi:10.21149/spm.v55s1.5099
  • Merchán-Price, Jorge, 2008, “La eutanasia no es un acto médico”, Persona y Bioética, 12(1): 42–52.
  • Mocellin Raymundo, Marcia, 2013, Consentimiento informado: desde sus orígenes hasta las nuevas perspectivas bajo el marco intercultural, Mexico City: Fontamara.
  • Olavarría, María Eugenia, 2022, “La no regulación de la gestación subrogada en México entre 2018 y 2021. ¿Laicismo o evangelismo?”, Inter Disciplina, 10(28): 111–128. doi:10.22201/ceiich.24485705e.2022.28.83292
  • Oliveira, Fátima, 2001, “As novas tecnologias reprodutivas conceptivas a serviço da materialização de desejos sexistas, racistas e eugênicos?”, Revista Bioética, 9(2): 99–112.
  • Ortega Bolaños, Jesús and Jorge Iván González, 2017, “Concepciones de justicia en el sistema de salud colombiano”, Revista Colombiana de Bioética, 12(2): 8–22. doi:10.18270/rcb.v12i2.2089
  • Ortiz Millán, Gustavo, 2009, La moralidad del aborto, México: Siglo XXI Editores.
  • –––, 2018, “Abortion and Conscientious Objection: Rethinking Conflicting Rights in the Mexican Context”, Global Bioethics, 29(1): 1–15. doi:10.1080/11287462.2017.1411224
  • –––, 2019, “Anti-Abortion Laws and the Ethics of Abortion”, in Rivera-López and Hevia 2019: 11–32. doi:10.1007/978-3-030-17963-2_2
  • –––, 2021, “Placebo-Controlled Trials of Covid-19 Vaccines – Are They Still Ethical?”, Indian Journal of Medical Ethics, 6(2): 96–99. doi:10.20529/IJME.2021.015
  • –––, 2024, “Laicidad y bioética”, in El estado laico mexicano a 30 años de la reforma constitucional (Serie Doctrina Jurídica 1011), Pauline Capdevielle and Pedro Salazar Ugarte (eds), Mexico City: Universidad Nacional Autónoma de México, Instituto de Investigaciones Jurídicas, 169–190.
  • Ortiz Millán, Gustavo and María de Jesús Medina Arellano (eds), 2021, COVID-19 y bioética (Serie Doctrina Jurídica 924), Mexico City: Universidad Nacional Autónoma de México, Instituto de Investigaciones Jurídicas.
  • Páez Moreno, Ricardo, 2015, Pautas bioéticas. La industria farmacéutica entre la ciencia y el mercado, Mexico City: Universidad Nacional Autónoma de México, Programa Universitario de Bioética, Fondo de Cultura Económica. doi:10.22201/pub.9786073006453p.2018
  • Palacios-González, C. and M. J. Medina-Arellano, 2017, “Mitochondrial replacement techniques and Mexico’s rule of law: on the legality of the first maternal spindle transfer case”, Journal of Law and the Biosciences 4(1): 50–69. doi:10.1093/jlb/lsw065
  • Penchaszadeh, Victor, 2022, “Bioética, salud y complejo médico-industrial-financiero. Una visión desde América Latina”, Revista Latinoamericana de Sociología, Política y Cultura, 4: 21–37. [Penchaszadeh 2022 available online]
  • Penteado Setti da Rocha, Anna Silvia, Thiago Rocha da Cunha, Waldir Souza, and Thereza D’Espindula, 2017, “Human Dignity, Misthanasia, Public Health and Bioethics in Brazil”, Revista Iberoamericana de Bioética, 5: 1–11. doi:10.14422/rib.i05.y2017.006
  • Pessini, Léo, 2004, “Distanásia: algumas reflexões bioéticas a partir da realidade brasileira”, Revista Bioética, 12(1): 39–60.
  • –––, 2010, “Lidando com pedidos de eutanásia: a inserção do filtro paliativo”, Revista Bioética, 18(3): 549–560.
  • Pessini, Léo, Christian de Paul de Barchifontaine, and Fernando Lolas Stepke (eds), 2010, Ibero-American Bioethics: History and Perspectives (Philosophy and Medicine, 106), Dordrecht/New York: Springer. doi:10.1007/978-1-4020-9350-0
  • Pietrini Sánchez, María José, 2022, “¿Es la gestación subrogada comercial moralmente inadmisible? La objeción de mercantilización”, Diánoia, 67(89): 3–38. doi:10.22201/iifs.18704913e.2022.89.1932
  • Platts, Mark, 1999, Sobre usos y abusos de la moral: Ética, sida, sociedad (Desde La Filosofía 1), México/Buenos Aires/Barcelona: Paidós-Universidad Nacional Autónoma de México. Second edition, Mexico City: Fondo de Cultura Económica-Universidad Nacional Autónoma de México, 2020.
  • Puleo, Alicia H., 2017, “Nuevas formas de desigualdad en un mundo globalizado. El alquiler de úteros como extractivismo”, Revista europea de derechos fundamentales, 29: 165–184.
  • Ramón Michel, Agustina, 2022, “Si tan solo fuera una decisión: la autonomía en la eutanasia”, in Tomando las consecuencias en serio: ensayos en homenaje a Martín Diego Farrell (Colección de ciencias jurídicas), Joaquín Millón Quintana and María Florencia Saulino (eds), Buenos Aires: Thompson Reuters, 85–116.
  • Ramón-Michel, Agustina, Stephanie Kung, Alyse López-Salm, and Sonia Ariza Navarrete, 2020, “Regulating Conscientious Objection to Legal Abortion in Argentina”, Health and Human Rights, 22(2): 271–283.
  • Ramón Michel, Agustina, Verónica Undurraga, Óscar A. Cabrera, and Andrés Constantin (eds), 2024, La objeción de conciencia en el área de la salud en América Latina, first edition, Bogotá: Siglo del Hombre Editores, Universidad de los Andes, O’Neill Institute. doi:10.2307/jj.12228591
  • Rego, Sergio and Marisa Palácios, 2016, “Ética, saúde global e a infecção pelo vírus Zika: uma visão a partir do Brasil” (“Ethics, Global Health and Zika Virus Infection: A View from Brazil”), Revista Bioética, 24(3): 430–434. Article in English. doi:10.1590/1983-80422016243141
  • Rendón, Eunice, 2021, “La perspectiva bioética de la cara más dura de la COVID-19: migración vulnerada y violencia de género”, in Ortiz Millán and Medina Arellano 2021: 173–198. doi:10.22201/iij.9786073048880e.2021.c10
  • Rivas, M. Georgina, Aus Nazar, Erin Jane Estrada, Emma Zapata, and Ramón Mariaca, 2009, “Violencia, Anticoncepción y Embarazo No Deseado. Mujeres Indígenas en San Cristóbal de Las Casas, Chiapas / Violence, Contraception and Unwanted Pregnancy Indigenous Women in San Cristóbal de Las Casas, Chiapas”, Estudios Demográficos y Urbanos, 24(3): 615–651. doi:10.24201/edu.v24i3.1330
  • Rivera López, Eduardo, 2013, “Conception, Fertilization and the Onset of Human Personhood: A Note on the Case Artavia Murillo et al. v. Costa Rica”, Inter-American and European Human Rights Journal, 6: 54–60.
  • –––, 2017, “Is Medically Assisted Death a Special Obligation?”, Journal of Medical Ethics, 43(6): 401–406. doi:10.1136/medethics-2016-103575
  • –––, 2024, “Euthanasia, Consensual Homicide, and Refusal of Treatment”, Bioethics, 38(4): 292–299. doi:10.1111/bioe.13261
  • Rivera López, Eduardo, Federico Abal, Romina Rekers, Felicitas Holzer, Irene Melamed, Diana Salmún, Laura Belli, Sol Terlizzi, Marcelo Alegre, Alahí Bianchini, and Ignacio Mastroleo, 2020, “Propuesta para la elaboración de un protocolo de triaje en el contexto de la pandemia de COVID-19”, Revista de Bioética y Derecho, 50: 37–61. doi:10.1344/rbd2020.50.31816
  • Rivera-López, Eduardo and Martin Hevia (eds), 2019, Controversies in Latin American Bioethics (International Library of Ethics, Law, and the New Medicine 79), Cham: Springer International Publishing. doi:10.1007/978-3-030-17963-2
  • Rodríguez, Eduardo and Fernando Lolas, 2011, “The Topic of Research Integrity in Latin America”, Bioethikos, 5(4): 362–368.
  • Romero, M., R. Gómez Ponce de Leon, L.F. Baccaro, et al., 2021, “Abortion-related morbidity in six Latin American and Caribbean countries: findings of the WHO/HRP multi-country survey on abortion (MCS-A)”, BMJ Global Health 6:e005618. doi:10.1136/ bmjgh-2021-005618
  • Rozo Prieto, César, 2022, Posición de la Iglesia Católica de Colombia frente al aborto y la eutanasia, Madrid: Universidad Pontificia Comillas. [Position available online]
  • Sabio, María Fernanda and Jaime Elías Bortz, 2015, “Estructura y funcionamiento de los comités de ética en investigación de la Ciudad Autónoma de Buenos Aires y el Gran Buenos Aires”, Salud Colectiva, 11(2): 247–260. doi:10.18294/sc.2015.687
  • Salles, Arleen L. F., 2002, “Autonomy and Culture: The Case of Latin America”, in Salles and Bertomeu 2002: 9–26 (ch. 1).
  • –––, 2004, “Bioethics, Differences, and Rights”, in Linking Visions: Feminist Bioethics, Human Rights, and the Developing World (Studies in Social, Political, and Legal Philosophy), Rosemarie Tong, Anne Donchin, and Susan Dodds (eds), Lanham, MD: Rowman & Littlefield Publishers, 57–72 (ch. 3).
  • Salles, Arleen L. F. and María Julia Bertomeu (eds), 2002, Bioethics: Latin American Perspectives (Value Inquiry Book Series 118), Amsterdam/New York: Rodopi. doi:10.1163/9789004494084
  • Schiavon, Raffaela, Erika Troncoso, and Gerardo Polo, 2012, “Analysis of Maternal and Abortion‐related Mortality in Mexico over the Last Two Decades, 1990–2008”, International Journal of Gynecology & Obstetrics, 118(S2): S78–S86. doi:10.1016/S0020-7292(12)60004-6
  • Sorokin, Patricia, María Angélica Sotomayor Saavedra, Blanca Bórquez Polloni, Myrna Martí, Alejandro Duro, Estela Quiroz Malca, Águeda Muñoz Del Carpio Toia, Eduardo A. Duro, Fabiola Czubaj, Laura Rueda, et al., 2020, “Datos en tiempos de pandemia: la urgencia de un nuevo pacto. Reflexiones desde América Latina y el Caribe”, Revista de Bioética y Derecho, 50: 221–237. doi:10.1344/rbd2020.50.31832
  • Souza, Maria do Carmo B. de, 2014, “Latin America and Access to Assisted Reproductive Techniques: A Brazilian Perspective”, JBRA Assisted Reproduction, 18(2): 47–51. doi:10.5935/1518-0557.20140004
  • Taboada, Paulina, 2008, “El respeto por la persona y su dignidad como fundamento de la bioética”, Vida y Ética, 9(2): 76–93. [Taboada 2008 available online]
  • Tealdi, Juan Carlos, 2005, “Los principios de Georgetown: análisis crítico”, in Estatuto epistemológico de la bioética, Volnei Garrafa, Miguel H. Kottow Lang, and Alya Saada (eds), México: Universidad Nacional Autónoma de México UNESCO, 35–53. [Tealdi 2005 available online]
  • Toro, Edgardo, Deyanira Duque, Magda L. Rincón, Cristobal Guerra, Fernanda Olivares, Magdalena Valenzuela, Corinne Reid, and Clara Calia, 2023, “Desafíos éticos para la investigación en Latinoamérica: una aproximación desde el punto de vista de los investigadores”, Revista Latinoamericana de Bioética, 23(2): 115–131. doi:10.18359/rlbi.6216
  • Ugalde, Antonio and Núria Homedes, 2011, “Cuatro palabras sobre ensayos clínicos: ciencia/negocio, riesgo/beneficio”, Salud Colectiva, 7(2): 135–148. doi:10.18294/sc.2011.369
  • Vaggione, Juan Marco, 2013, Laicidad y sexualidad (Colección de cuadernos Jorge Carpizo. Para entender y pensar la laicidad 16), México: Universidad Nacional Autónoma de México.
  • Valdés, Margarita, 1999, “El problema del aborto tres enfoques”, in Bioética y derecho: fundamentos y problemas actuales, Rodolfo Vázquez (ed.), Mexico City: Fondo de Cultura Económica, Instituto Tecnológico Autónomo de México, 129–150 (ch. 6).
  • van Delden, Johannes J. M. and Rieke van der Graaf, 2017, “Revised CIOMS International Ethical Guidelines for Health-Related Research Involving Humans”, JAMA, 317(2): 135–136. doi:10.1001/jama.2016.18977
  • Vázquez, Rodolfo, 2004, Del aborto a la clonación: principios de una bioética liberal, Mexico City: Fondo de Cultura Económica.
  • Verástegui, Emma L, 2006, “Consenting of the Vulnerable: The Informed Consent Procedure in Advanced Cancer Patients in Mexico”, BMC Medical Ethics, 7(1): article 13. doi:10.1186/1472-6939-7-13
  • Wertheimer, Alan, 1996, Exploitation, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • –––, 2011, Rethinking the Ethics of Clinical Research: Widening the Lens, Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199743513.001.0001
  • Zambrano, María del Pilar, 2016, “Omisión y suspensión de cuidados vitales: ¿matar o dejar morir? Una aproximación desde los criterios morales y jurídicos de tipificación de la acción”, Cuadernos de bioética, 27(89): 53–68.
  • Zegers-Hochschild, Fernando., 1999, “Attitudes towards Reproduction in Latin America. Teachings from the Use of Modern Reproductive Technologies”, Human Reproduction Update, 5(1): 21–25. doi:10.1093/humupd/5.1.21
  • –––, 2016, “Access to ARTs in Latin America”, in Assisted Reproductive Technologies in the Global South and North: Issues, Challenges and the Future, Virginie Rozée and Sayeed Unisa (eds), New York: Routledge, 17–25.
  • Zenilman, Jonathan, 2013, “The Guatemala Sexually Transmitted Disease Studies: What Happened”, Sexually Transmitted Diseases, 40(4): 277–279. doi:10.1097/OLQ.0b013e31828abc1b
  • Zion, Deborah, Lynn Gillam, and Bebe Loff, 2000, “The Declaration of Helsinki, CIOMS and the Ethics of Research on Vulnerable Populations”, Nature Medicine, 6(6): 615–617. doi:10.1038/76174
  • Zúñiga Fajuri, Alejandra, 2011, “Justicia y racionamiento sanitario en el Plan AUGE: dilemas bioéticos asociados a la distribución de recursos escasos”, Acta bioethica, 17(1): 73–84. doi:10.4067/S1726-569X2011000100009
  • –––, 2014, “La distribución de recursos escasos en la atención de salud con base en la Teoría de las necesidades, ¿una idea añeja?”, Convergencia. Revista de Ciencias Sociales, 21(64): 169–187.

Acknowledgments

The authors would like to thank Bernardo Aguilera, Arleen Salles, Rodolfo Vázquez, and an anonymous reviewer for their valuable comments and suggestions to an earlier version of this entry.

Copyright © 2026 by
Gustavo Ortiz Millán <gmom@filosoficas.unam.mx>
Florencia Luna <florlunaflacso@gmail.com>
Eduardo Rivera López <erivera@utdt.edu>

Open access to the SEP is made possible by a world-wide funding initiative.
The Encyclopedia Now Needs Your Support
Please Read How You Can Help Keep the Encyclopedia Free