Race

First published Wed May 28, 2008; substantive revision Sun Feb 2, 2025

The concept of race has historically signified the division of humanity into a small number of groups based upon five criteria: (1) Races reflect some type of biological foundation, be it Aristotelian essences or modern genes; (2) This biological foundation generates discrete racial groupings, such that all and only all members of one race share a set of biological characteristics that are not shared by members of other races; (3) This biological foundation is inherited from generation to generation, allowing observers to identify an individual’s race through her ancestry or genealogy; (4) Genealogical investigation should identify each race’s geographic origin, typically in Africa, Europe, Asia, or North and South America; and (5) This inherited racial biological foundation manifests itself primarily in physical phenotypes, such as skin color, eye shape, hair texture, and bone structure, and perhaps also behavioral phenotypes, such as intelligence or delinquency.

This historical concept of race has faced substantial scientific and philosophical challenge, with some important thinkers denying both the logical coherence of the concept and the very existence of races. Others defend the concept of race, albeit with substantial changes to the foundations of racial identity, which they depict as either socially constructed or, if biologically grounded, neither discrete nor essentialist, as the historical concept would have it.

Both in the past and today, determining the boundaries of discrete races has proven to be most vexing and has led to great variations in the number of human races believed to be in existence. Thus, some thinkers categorized humans into only four distinct races (typically white or Caucasian, Black or African, yellow or Asian, and red or Native American), and downplayed any biological or phenotypical distinctions within racial groups (such as those between Scandinavians and Spaniards within the white or Caucasian race). Other thinkers classified humans into many more racial categories, for instance arguing that those humans “indigenous” to Europe could be distinguished into discrete Nordic, Alpine, and Mediterranean races.

The ambiguities and confusion associated with determining the boundaries of racial categories have led to the widespread position that discrete or essentialist races are socially constructed, not biologically real. However, significant scholarly debate persists regarding whether reproductive isolation, either during human evolution or through modern practices barring interracial relations, may have generated sufficient genetic isolation as to justify using the term race to signify the existence of non-discrete human groups that share not only physical phenotypes but also clusters of genetic material. In addition, scholarly debate exists concerning the formation and character of socially constructed, discrete racial categories. For instance, some scholars suggest that race is inconceivable without racialized social hierarchies, while others argue that egalitarian race relations are possible. Finally, substantial controversy surrounds the moral status of racial identity and solidarity and the justice and legitimacy of policies or institutions aimed at undermining racial inequality.

This entry focuses primarily on contemporary scholarship regarding the conceptual, ontological, epistemological, and normative questions pertaining to race, with an introductory section on the history of the concept of race in the West and in Western philosophy. Aside from some discussion in Section 5, it does not focus in depth on authors such as Frederick Douglass, W.E.B. Du Bois, or Frantz Fanon, or concepts, such as négritude, critical philosophy of race, or philosophy of liberation. Interested readers should consult these relevant entries for insight into these and other topics important to the study of race in philosophy.

In Section 1, we trace the historical origins and development of the concept of race. Section 2 covers contemporary philosophical debates over whether races actually exist. Thereafter, in Section 3 we examine the differences between race and ethnicity. Section 4 surveys debates among moral, political and legal philosophers over the validity of racial identity, racial solidarity, and race-specific policies such as affirmative action and race-based representation. Section 5 outlines engagement with the concept of race within Continental philosophy.

1. History of the Concept of Race

The dominant position is that race is a modern concept. However, in recent years some scholars have challenged this position by defending the existence of pre-modern concepts of race. Any attempt to clarify, if not resolve, this debate itself requires addressing two conceptual questions: first, what constitutes a concept of race; and second, what constitutes the modern age. While this entry began by articulating the classic modern concept of biological race, some scholars have suggested that ancient and medieval settings developed their own race concepts that differ from the modern version. Hence, the question is whether these pre-modern versions really count as a race concept or instead reflect some other form of human categorization. In turn, the claim that a race concept developed in the medieval world itself requires a determination of what counts as a medieval, as opposed to a modern, social context. For a pre-modern concept of race to exist, this concept must truly represent a concept of race and, additionally, must have emerged in a truly pre-modern context.

The need for conceptual clarity regarding race and modernity is less pressing for scholars who focus on forms of racism in ancient Greek and Roman settings.The influential work of classicist Frank Snowden (1970; 1983), who emphasized the lack of antiblack prejudice in the ancient world, led many scholars of race to conclude that racism did not exist in that epoch. However, later classicists have responded that Snowden’s work unnecessarily reduced all forms of racism to its versions based on skin color and other markers of non-white identity. Benjamin Isaac (2004) and Denise McCoskey (2012) contend that the ancient Greeks and Romans did hold proto-racist views that applied to other groups which today might be considered white. Isaac persuasively argues that these views must be considered proto-racist: although they were formed without the aid of a modern race concept grounded in ideas of deterministic biology (2004, 5), they nevertheless resembled modern racism by attributing “to groups of people common characteristics considered to be unalterable because they are determined by external factors or heredity” (2004, 38). More importantly, both Isaac and McCoskey contend that ancient proto-racism influenced the development of modern racism.

Conceptual clarity is, however, indispensable for evaluating the claim by Geraldine Heng (2011a, 2011b, 2018) that a race concept existed in the medieval world and applied specifically to Jews in thirteenth century England. In order to defend this position, Heng articulates a “working hypothesis” of what can constitute the concept of race.

‘Race’ is one of the primary names we have for demarcating human beings according to differences that are selectively essentialized as absolute and fundamental, in order to distribute positions and powers differentially to human groups – a name we retain precisely for the strategic, epistemological, and political commitments it recognizes. Racial formation therefore occurs as specific historical occasions in which strategic essentialisms are posited and assigned through a variety of practices and pressures, so as to construct a hierarchy of peoples for differential treatment. My understanding, thus, is that race is a structural relationship for the articulation and management of human differences, rather than a substantive content. (Heng 2011a, 324–5; Heng 2011b, 332)

Importantly, Heng’s definition of the concept of race does not require any claims about putative “substantive” biological foundations to this human category. Rather, the conditions for a human grouping to fall within the concept of race is (1) the employment of “selectively essentialized” traits in order (2) “to construct a hierarchy” among human groups. For Heng, the thirteenth century English version of the race concept draws on religion, rather than biology, in order to categorize Jews as possessing essentialized traits that justify their collective subordination.

Interestingly, Heng is not committed to a clear conceptual boundary between the medieval and modern worlds and instead supports the idea of multiple modernities in different socio-historical contexts (2011a, 321). That said, she nevertheless titles her work “The Invention of Race in the European Middle Ages,” thereby suggesting that the thirteenth century English race concept as applied to Jews is not necessarily modern. Indeed, most of her discussion of multiple modernities seems animated by a desire to defend the thirteenth century English concept as truly racial, as opposed to ethnic or religious, even though it lacks the biological references associated with prototypical modern race concepts.

Adam Hochman (2019) rejects the position that race is a purely modern concept, while also contesting Heng’s position that the 13th century English categorization of Jews as a subordinate race actually reflected a real race concept. He comes to this conclusion by disambiguating the question “Is race modern?” into six discrete questions.

1) Is the concept of race modern? (2) Is there a modern concept of race that is distinct from earlier race concepts? (3) Are “races” themselves modern? (4) Are racialized groups modern? (5) Are the means and methods associated with racialization modern? (6) Are the meanings attached to racialized traits modern? (Hochman 2019, 647)

Most race theorists conflate the first three questions and never address the last three. But because questions 3–6 apply less to Hochman’s historical inquiry and more to his positive project of defending the concept of “racialized groups” as opposed to the concept of “race,” we will focus only on questions 1 and 2. To these questions, Hochman concludes that (1) the concept of race is not modern but late medieval and that (2) the modern concept of race is distinct from the late medieval concept. He comes to this conclusion by defining the concept of race through reference to biological genealogical criteria and by clearly demarcating a boundary between the medieval and modern worlds.

For Hochman, the late medieval concept of race counts as a concept of race because it contains the following four components (652):

(1) Races form due to their reproductive isolation.

(2) Races constitute major human lineages.

(3) Races are major biological groups in the present.

(4) Race is biologically inherited.

This late medieval concept of race emerged in the form of Spanish statutes of blood purity (limpieza de sangre), first issued in 1449 in order to categorize the race, or raza, of conversos (Jewish converts to Christianity), who were to be distinguished from and subordinated to Christianos viejos (“old Christians”). Hochman holds that this medieval categorization is racial precisely because it contains these four components. This is not the case with the thirteenth century English Jews foregrounded by Heng, since their distinct and subordinate status, including even their putative biological differences, could be negated through conversion to Christianity (655–657). That said, the late medieval concept of race differed from the modern concept of race, which added two additional components (652):

(5) All human populations belong to at least one race.

(6) Race is the taxonomic level below species in humans.

Unlike modern race theories, which tried to fit all humans into a race category, the late medieval Spanish race concept only applied to converted Jews and Muslims, not to other Christians. In addition, like other premodern theories, the Spanish race concept did not depict race as a form of sub-species categorization. Hence, the late medieval race concept is distinct from the modern race concept.

But why is the Spanish racial concept of the mid-fifteenth century “late medieval” and not simply an earlier modern concept, especially since Hochman acknowledges that modern theory of Francois Bernier did not identify race as a sub-species category (6), even though it did seek to place every human into a specific race category (5) (653). Hochman’s answer depends on his adoption of the “conventional” date of 1492 as the beginning of the modern age, a date chosen because of its coincidence with the expulsion of the Jews from Spain and Columbus’ arrival in the “New World” (648). This conventionalist boundary seems unjustifiably precise for Hochman’s conceptual purposes. Indeed, one might argue that the emergence of a race concept went hand in hand with the broader process of modernization in fifteenth century Spain, which in 1492 also achieved unified territorial state sovereignty – another hallmark of modernity – through the reconquest of the last independent Islamic principality in Granada.

Viewing the emergence of the modern concept of race in fifteenth century Iberia allows for a more supple and continuous portrait, one that can encompass holistically not only the emergence of blood purity statutes but also the emergence of the Spanish Inquisition, ostensibly meant to stamp out Jewish practices among conversos but arguably employed to seize the property of converted Jews (and later converted Muslims) who had become sincerely practicing Christians.

Seeing modern race as gradually emerging throughout fifteenth century allows us also to incorporate the first stirrings of antiblack and anti-Native-American racism in the Iberian peninsula. Since this region was the first in Europe to utilize African slavery while gradually rejecting the enslavement of fellow European Christians, Iberian Christians may have come to associate Black people as physically and mentally suitable only for menial labor. In this they were influenced by Arab slave merchants, who assigned the worst tasks to their dark-skinned slaves while assigning more complex labor to light or tawny-skinned slaves. The “discovery” of the New World by Iberian explorers also brought European Christians into contact with Indigenous Americans for the first time. This resulted in the heated debate in Valladolid in 1550 between Bartolomé Las Casas and Gines de Sepúlveda over whether the Indians were by nature inferior and thus worthy of enslavement and conquest. Whether due to Las Casas’ victory over Sepúlveda, or due to the hierarchical character of Spanish Catholicism which did not require the dehumanization of other races in order to justify slavery, the Spanish empire did avoid the racialization of its conquered peoples and African slaves. Indeed, arguably it was the conflict between the Enlightenment ideals of universal freedom and equality versus the fact of the European enslavement of Africans and Indigenous Americans that fostered the development of the idea of race (Bernasconi and Lott 2000, vii; Hannaford 1996, 122–126, 149–150; Frederickson 2002, 29–35; Blum 2002, 111–112).

While events in the Iberian Peninsula may have provided the initial stirrings of modern racial sentiments, the concept of race, with its close links to ideas of deterministic biology, emerged with the rise of modern natural philosophy and its concern with taxonomy (Smith 2015). The first important articulation of the race concept came with the 1684 publication of “A New Division of the Earth” by Francois Bernier (1625–1688) (Bernasconi and Lott 2000, viii; Hannaford 1996, 191, 203). Based on his travels through Egypt, India, and Persia, this essay presented a division of humanity into “four or five species or races of men in particular whose difference is so remarkable that it may be properly made use of as the foundation for a new division of the earth” (Bernasconi and Lott 2000, 1–2). First were the peoples inhabiting most of Europe and North Africa, extending eastward through Persia, northern and central India, and right up to parts of contemporary Indonesia. Despite their differing skin tones, these peoples nevertheless shared common physical characteristics, such as hair texture and bone structure. The second race was constituted by the people of Africa south of the Sahara Desert, who notably possessed smooth Black skin, thick noses and lips, thin beards, and wooly hair. The peoples inhabiting lands from east Asia, through China, today’s central Asian states such as Uzbekistan, and westward into Siberia and eastern Russia represented the third race, marked by their “truly white” skin, broad shoulders, flat faces, flat noses, thin beards, and long, thin eyes, while the short and squat Sami peoples of northern Scandinavia constituted the fourth race. Bernier considered whether the Indigenous peoples of the Americas were a fifth race, but he ultimately assigned them to the first (Bernasconi and Lott 2000, 2–3).

But while Bernier initiated the use of the term “race” to distinguish different groups of humans based on physical traits, his failure to reflect on the relationship between racial division and the human race in general mitigated the scientific rigor of his definition (Bernasconi and Lott 2000, viii). Central to a scientific concept of race would be a resolution of the question of monogenesis versus polygenesis. Monogenesis adhered to the Biblical creation story in asserting that all humans descended from a common ancestor, perhaps Adam of the Book of Genesis; polygenesis, on the other hand, asserted that different human races descended from different ancestral roots. Thus, the former position contended that all races are nevertheless members of a common human species, whereas the latter saw races as distinct species.

David Hume’s position on the debate between polygenesis versus monogenesis is the subject of some scholarly debate. The bone of contention is his essay “Of National Characters,” where he contends that differences among European nations are attributable not to natural differences but to cultural and political influences. Amidst this argument against crude naturalism, Hume inserts a footnote in the 1754 edition, wherein he writes: “I am apt to suspect the negroes and in general all the other species of men (for there are four or five different kinds) to be naturally inferior to whites. There never was a civilized nation of any other complexion than white, nor even any individual eminent either in action or speculation” (Zack 2002, 15; emphasis added). Whereas even the most barbarous white nations such as the Germans “have something eminent about them,” the “uniform and constant difference” in accomplishment between whites and non-whites could not occur “if nature had not made an original distinction betwixt these breeds of men” (Zack 2002, 15). Responding to criticism, he softens this position in the 1776 edition, restricting his claims to natural inferiority only to “negroes,” stating that “scarcely ever was a civilized nation of that complexion, not even of individual eminent in action or speculation” (Zack 2002, 17; Hume 1776 [1987], 208; emphasis added). Richard Popkin (1977) and Naomi Zack (2002, 13–18) contend that the 1754 version of the essay assumes, without demonstration, an original, polygenetic difference between white and non-white races. Andrew Valls (2005, 132) denies that either version of the footnote espouses polygenesis.

A strong and clear defense of monogenesis was provided by Immanuel Kant (1724–1804) in his essay “Of the Different Human Races,” first published in 1775 and revised in 1777. Kant argued that all humans descend from a common human “lineal root genus” in Europe, which contained the biological “seeds” and “dispositions” that can generate the distinct physical traits of race when triggered by divergent environmental factors, especially combinations of heat and humidity. This, combined with patterns of migration, geographic isolation, and in-breeding, led to the differentiation of four distinct, pure races: the “noble blond” of northern Europe; the “copper red” of America (and east Asia); the “black” of Senegambia in Africa; and the “olive-yellow” of Asian-India. Once these discrete racial groups were developed over many generations, further climatic changes will not alter racial phenotypes (Bernasconi and Lott 2000, 8–22).

Yet despite the distinction generated between different races, Kant’s monogenetic account led him to maintain that the different races were part of a common human species. As evidence, he adduced the fact that individuals from different races were able to breed together, and their offspring tended to exhibit blended physical traits inherited from both parents. Not only did blending indicate that the parents were part of a common species; it also indicated that they are of distinct races. For the physical traits of parents of the same race are not blended but often passed on exclusively: a blond white man and a brunette white woman may have four blond children, without any blending of this physical trait; whereas a Black man and a white woman will bear children who blend white and Black traits (Bernasconi and Lott 2000, 9–10). Such inter-racial mixtures accounted for the existence of liminal individuals, whose physical traits seem to lie between the discrete boundaries of one of the four races; peoples who do not fit neatly into one or another race are explained away as groups whose seeds have not been fully triggered by the appropriate environmental stimuli (Bernasconi and Lott 2000, 11).

The secondary literature on Kant and the concept of race is too extensive to be fully cataloged here, but following Huaping Lu-Adler we can identify two broad, though non-exhaustive, strands within it (Lu-Adler 2023, 2n4): those that are more critical of Kant through the lens of his racist conception of race, and those that defend Kant’s broader philosophy despite those views. Emmanuel Eze (1995), Charles Mills (2005), and Robert Bernasconi (2001, 2002) are representative of the former group, while in the latter we find Louden (2000), Hill and Boxill (2001), Kleingeld (2007), and Allais (2016).

We focus here on Kleingeld (2007) because of her 2007 essay’s centrality to contemporary Kant scholarship on race, though she later reiterates her position (2019). She argues that Kant significantly changed his mind about race over the course of his writings. Situating her claim between, on the one hand, those commentators who argue that Kant’s racism renders his moral theory non-universalistic, and, on the other hand, those who accept the universalism of his moral theory and interpret his views on racial hierarchy as Kant contradicting himself, Kleingeld puts forward the thesis that Kant’s views on racial hierarchy changed prior to the publication of Toward Perpetual Peace in 1795 (2007, 575). In that text and in the Metaphysics of Morals, she argues, Kant “becomes more egalitarian with regard to race” (2007, 586). He does so through a rejection of colonialism, chattel slavery, and the slave trade (2007, 586–588).

According to Huaping Lu-Adler, Kleingeld’s 2007 paper had a “narrative-shaping” effect on the field, so much so that it has come to be accepted with “resounding confidence” (2022, 264, 266). Lu-Adler, against Kleingeld’s reading of Kant’s purported development regarding race and racism, argues that a better explanation for Kant’s remarks in his later works, the ones on which Kleingeld bases her argument, is that, “given the political realities in the 1790s, he became concerned about their potential to impede human progress by indirectly worsening intra-European power struggles and dimming the prospect of perpetual peace.” That is, Kant treated racial slavery not as a moral problem but as a “disinterested philosopher of history” (2022, 269).

Lu-Adler further develops her own position to argue, first, that Kant held a consistent inegalitarian position throughout his writings and teachings (2023, 18). Further, though, she argues that we can also look to and learn from Kant’s sensitivity to the political realities of his day and his pragmatism (2023, 22), even as our perspectives should be differently directed, toward corrective racial justice (2023, 23). Her analysis of Kant’s racialism combines his roles as both scholar and teacher, highlighting his central role in shaping the prevailing view of race.

The “science” of race was furthered by the man sometimes considered to be the father of modern anthropology, Johann Friedrich Blumenbach (1752–1840). In his doctoral dissertation, “On the Natural Variety of Mankind,” first published in 1775, Blumenbach identified four “varieties” of mankind: the peoples of Europe, Asia, Africa, and America. His essay was revised and republished both in 1781, wherein he introduced a fifth variety of mankind, that inhabiting the South Pacific islands, and in 1795, wherein he first coined the term “Caucasian” to describe the variety of people inhabiting Europe, West Asia, and Northern India. This term reflected his claim that this variety originated in the Caucuses mountains, in Georgia, justifying this etiology through reference to the superior beauty of the Georgians. The 1795 version also included the terms Mongolian to describe the non-Caucasian peoples of Asia, Ethiopian to signify Black Africans, American to denote the Indigenous peoples of the New World, and Malay to identify the South Pacific Islanders (Bernasconi and Lott 2000, 27–33; Hannaford 1996, 207).

While noting differences in skin tone, he based his varieties upon the structures of the cranium, which supposedly gave his distinctions a stronger scientific foundation than the more superficial characteristic of color (Hannaford 1996, 206). In addition, he strongly denied polygenetic accounts of racial difference, noting the ability of members of different varieties to breed with each other, something that humans were incapable of doing with other species. Indeed, he took great pains to dismiss as spurious accounts of Africans mating with apes or of monstrous creatures formed through the union of humans with other animals (Hannaford 1996, 208–9). In final support of his more scientific, monogenist approach, Blumenbach posited the internal, biological force which generated racial difference, the “nisus formativus,” which when triggered by specific environmental stimuli generated the variations found within the varieties of humans (Hannaford 1996, 212).

Despite the strong monogenist arguments provided by Kant and Blumenbach, polygenesis remained a viable intellectual strain within race theory, particularly in the “American School of Anthropology,” embodied by Louis Agassiz, Robins Gliddon, and Josiah Clark Nott. Agassiz was born in Switzerland, received an M.D. in Munich and later studied zoology, geology, and paleontology in various German universities under the influence of Romantic scientific theories. His orthodox Christian background initially imbued him with a strong monogenist commitment, but upon visiting America and seeing an African American for the first time, Agassiz experienced a type of conversion experience, which led him to question whether these remarkably different people could share the same blood as Europeans. Eventually staying on and making his career in America, and continually struck by the physical character of African Americans, Agassiz officially announced his turn to polygenesis at the 1850 meeting of the American Association for the Advancement of Science (AAAS) in Charleston, South Carolina. Nott, a South Carolina physician, attended the same AAAS meeting and, along with Gliddon, joined Agassiz in the promulgation of the American School’s defense of polygenesis (Brace 2005, 93–103).

Along with Agassiz, Nott was also influenced by the French romantic race theorist Arthur de Gobineau (1816–1882), whose “Essay on the Inequality of the Human Races” (1853–1855) Nott partially translated into English and published for the American audience. Although the Catholic Gobineau initially espoused monogenesis, he later leaned towards polygenesis and ended up ambivalent on this issue (Hannaford 1996, 268–269). Nevertheless, Gobineau lent credence to the white racial supremacy that Nott supported (Brace 2005, 120–121). Gobineau posited two impulses among humans, that of attraction and repulsion. Civilization emerges when humans obey the law of attraction and intermingle with peoples of different racial stocks. According the Gobineau, the white race was created through such intermingling, which allowed it alone to generate civilization, unlike the other races, which were governed only by the law of repulsion. Once civilization is established, however, further race mixing leads to the degeneration of the race through a decline in the quality of its blood. Consequently, when the white race conquers other Black or yellow races, any further intermingling will lead it to decline. Thus, Gobineau claimed that the white race would never die so long as its blood remains composed of its initial mixture of peoples. Notably, Nott strategically excised those sections discussing the law of attraction when translating Gobineau’s essay for an American audience (Bernasconi and Lott 2000, 45–51).

Eventually, polygenesis declined through the intellectual success of Charles Darwin’s theory of evolution (Brace 2005, 124). Darwin himself weighed in on this debate in the chapter “On the Races of Man” in his book The Descent of Man (1871), arguing that as the theory of evolution gains wider acceptance, “the dispute between the monogenists and the polygenists will die a silent and unobserved death” (Bernasconi and Lott 2000, 68), with the former winning out. The rest of the essay entertained both sides of the debate regarding whether or not different races constitute different species or sub-species of humans. Although Darwin did not explicitly take sides in this debate, the preponderance of his argument gives little support to the idea of races being different species. For instance, he noted that couples from different races produce fertile offspring, and that individuals from different races seem to share many mental similarities. That said, while Darwinian evolution may have killed off polygenesis and the related idea that the races constituted distinct species, it hardly killed off race itself. Darwin himself did not think natural selection would by itself generate racial distinctions, since the physical traits associated with racial differences did not seem sufficiently beneficial to favor their retention; he did, however, leave open a role for sexual selection in the creation of races, through repeated mating among individuals with similar traits (Bernasconi and Lott 2000, 77–78). Consequently, later race thinkers would replace polygenesis with natural selection and sexual selection as scientific mechanisms whereby racial differentiation could slowly, unintentionally, but nevertheless inevitably proceed (Hannaford 1996, 273).

Sexual selection became a central focus for race-thinking with the introduction of the term “eugenics” in 1883 by Francis Galton (1822–1911) in his essay “Inquiries into Human Faculty and Development” (Hannaford 1996, 290). Focusing on physical as opposed to “moral” qualities, Galton advocated selective breeding to improve the “health, energy, ability, manliness, and courteous disposition” of the human species in his later essay “Eugenics: Its Definition, Scope, and Aims” (Bernasconi and Lott 2000, 80). Following the same currents of “Social Darwinism” that advocated the evolutionary improvement of the human condition through active human intervention, Galton proposed making eugenics not only an element in popular culture or “a new religion” (Bernasconi and Lott 2000, 82) but even a policy enforced by the American government. While positive eugenics, or the enforced breeding of higher types, never became law, negative eugenics, or the sterilization of the feebleminded or infirm, did become public policy enforced by a number of American states and upheld by the United States Supreme Court in an eight-to-one decision in Buck v. Bell (274 U.S. 200, 1927). The widespread acceptance of negative eugenics can be inferred by the fact that the Court Opinion justifying the decision was authored by Justice Oliver Wendell Holmes, a figure usually associated with progressive and civil libertarian positions, and whose doctrine of “clear and present danger” sought to expand the protection of free speech.

The apogee of post-Darwinian race-thinking was arguably reached in the book The Foundations of the Nineteenth Century by Houston Stewart Chamberlain (1855–1927), the son-in-law of German opera composer Richard Wagner. Chamberlain argued in the evolutionary terms of sexual selection that distinct races emerged through geographical and historical conditions which create inbreeding among certain individuals with similar traits (Hannaford 1996, 351). Moving from this initial specification, Chamberlain then argued that the key strands of western civilization—Christianity and ancient Greek philosophy and art—emerged from the Aryan race. Jesus, for instance, was held to be of Aryan stock, despite his Jewish religion, since the territory of Galilee was populated by peoples descended from Aryan Phonecians as well as by Semitic Jews. Similarly, Aristotle’s distinction between Greeks and Barbarians was reinterpreted as a racial distinction between Aryans and non-Aryans. These Greek and Christian strands became united in Europe, particularly during the Reformation, which allowed the highest, Teutonic strain of the Aryan race to be freed from constraining Roman Catholic cultural fetters. But while Roman institutions and practices may have constrained the Teutonic Germans, their diametric opposite was the Jew, the highest manifestation of the Semitic Race. The European religious tensions between Christian and Jew were thus transformed into racial conflicts, for which conversion or ecumenical tolerance would have no healing effect. Chamberlain’s writings, not surprisingly, have come to be seen as some of the key intellectual foundations for twentieth century German anti-Semitism, of which Adolf Hitler was simply its most extreme manifestation.

If Chamberlain’s writings served as intellectual fodder for German racial prejudice, Madison Grant (1865–1937) provided similar foundations for American race prejudice against Black people and Native Americans in his popular book The Passing of the Great Race (1916). Rejecting political or educational means of ameliorating the destitution of the subordinate racial groups in America, Grant instead advocated strict segregation and the prohibition of miscegenation, or the interbreeding of members of different races (Hannaford 1996, 358). Like Galton, Grant had similar success in influencing American public policy, both through the imposition of racist restrictions on immigration at the federal level and through the enforcement of anti-miscegenation laws in thirty states, until such prohibitions were finally overturned by the United States Supreme Court in Loving v. Virginia (388 U.S. 1 [1967]).

If the apogee of biological race was reached in the early twentieth century, its decline began at about the same time. While writers such as Chamberlain and Grant popularized and politicized biological conceptions of race hierarchy, academic anthropologists since Blumenbach gave the concept of race its scientific validity. But academic anthropology also provided the first challenge to biological race in the person of Columbia University professor Franz Boas (1858–1942), a German-born Jewish immigrant to the United States. Boas challenged the fixed character of racial groups by taking on one of the key fundaments to racial typology, cranium size. Boas showed that this characteristic was profoundly affected by environmental factors, noting that American-born members of various “racial” types, such as Semitic Jews, tended to have larger crania than their European-born parents, a result of differences in nourishment. From this he concluded that claims about racially differential mental capacities could similarly be reduced to such environmental factors. In so doing, Boas undermined one measure of racial distinction, and although he did not go so far as to reject entirely the concept of biological race itself, he strongly influenced anthropologists to shift their focus from putatively fixed biological characteristics to apparently mutable cultural factors in order to understand differences among human groups (Bernasconi and Lott 2000, 84–88; Brace 2005, 167–169; Cornell and Hartmann 1998, 42–43).

A stronger anthropological rejection of the biological conception of race was leveled by Ashley Montagu (1905–1999). Drawing on insights from modern, experimental genetics, Montagu forcefully argued that the anthropological conception of race relied on grouping together various perceptible physical characteristics, whereas the real building blocks of evolution were genes, which dictated biological changes among populations at a much finer level. The morphological traits associated with race, thus, were gross aggregates of a variety of genetic changes, some of which resulted in physically perceptible characteristics, many others of which resulted in imperceptible changes. Moreover, since genetic evolution can occur through both the mixture of different genes and the mutation of the same gene over generations, the traits associated with races cannot be attributed to discrete lines of genetic descent, since the dark skin and curly hair of one individual may result from genetic mixture while the same traits in another individual may result from genetic mutation (Bernasconi and Lott 2000, 100–107). Montagu’s efforts eventually resulted in the publication of an official statement denying the biological foundations of race by the United Nations Educational, Scientific, and Cultural Organization (UNESCO) in 1950, although it would take until 1996 for the American Association of Physical Anthropologists (AAPA) to publish a similar document (Brace 2005, 239).

2. Do Races Exist? Contemporary Philosophical Debates

Ron Mallon (2004, 2006, 2007) provides a nice sketch of the contemporary philosophical terrain regarding the status of the concept of race, dividing it into three valid competing schools of thought regarding the ontological status of race, along with the discarded biological conception. Racial naturalism signifies the old, biological conception of race, which depicts races as bearing “biobehavioral essences: underlying natural (and perhaps genetic) properties that (1) are heritable, biological features, (2) are shared by all and only the members of a race, and (3) explain behavioral, characterological, and cultural predispositions of individual persons and racial groups” (2006, 528–529). While philosophers and scientists have reached the consensus against racial naturalism, philosophers nevertheless disagree on the possible ontological status of a different conception of race. Mallon divides such disagreements into three metaphysical camps (racial skepticism, racial constructivism, and racial population naturalism) and two normative camps (eliminativism and conservationism).

Racial skepticism holds that because racial naturalism is false, races of any type do not exist. Racial skeptics, such as Anthony Appiah (1995, 1996) and Naomi Zack (1993, 2002) contend that the term race cannot refer to anything real in the world, since the one thing in the world to which the term could uniquely refer—discrete, essentialist, biological races—have been proven not to exist. Zack (2002, 87–88) provides an accessible summary of the racial skeptic’s argument against the biological foundations for race, sequentially summarizing the scientific rejection of essences, geography, phenotypes, post-Mendelian transmission genetics, and genealogies as possible foundations for races. Aristotelian essences, thought to ground the common characteristics of distinct species, were correctly rejected by early modern philosophers. If essences cannot even ground differences among species, then they clearly cannot ground the differences among races, which even nineteenth century racial science still understood as members of the same species. Whereas folk theories rely on geography to divide humanity into African, European, Asian, and Amerindian races, contemporary population genetics reveal the vacuity of this foundation for two reasons. First, geographically based environmental stimuli lead to continuous physical adaptations in skin, hair and bone rather than the discrete differences associated with race; and second, although mitochondrial DNA mutations provide evidence of the geographical origins of populations, these mutations do not correlate with the physical traits associated with racial groups. Similarly, phenotypes cannot ground folk theories of race: for instance, differences in skin tone are gradual, not discrete; and blood-type variations occur independently of the more visible phenotypes associated with race, such as skin color and hair texture. Race cannot be founded upon transmission genetics, since the genes transmitted from one generation to the next lead to very specific physical traits, not general racial characteristics shared by all members of a putatively racial group. And finally, genealogy cannot ground race, since clades (populations descended from a common ancestor) may have common genetic characteristics, but these need not correlate with the visible traits associated with races. Zack concludes: “Essences, geography, phenotypes, genotypes, and genealogy are the only known candidates for physical scientific bases of race. Each fails. Therefore, there is no physical scientific basis for the social racial taxonomy” (Zack 2002, 88).

Racial skeptics like Appiah and Zack adopt normative racial eliminativism, which recommends discarding the concept of race entirely, according to the following argument. Because of its historical genealogy, the term race can only refer to one or more discrete groups of people who alone share biologically significant genetic features. Such a monopoly on certain genetic features could only emerge within a group that practices such a high level of inbreeding that it is effectively genetically isolated. Such genetic isolation might refer to the Amish in America (Appiah 1996, 73) or to Irish Protestants (Zack 2002, 69), but they clearly cannot refer to those groupings of people presently subsumed under American racial census categories. Because the concept “race” can only apply to groups not typically deemed races (Amish, Irish Protestants), and because this concept cannot apply to groups typically deemed races (African Americans, Whites, Asians, Native Americans), a mismatch occurs between the concept and its typical referent. Thus, the concept of race must be eliminated due to its logical incoherence (Mallon 2006, 526, 533).

Appiah has since modified his skepticism in such a way that softens the eliminitivist element of his position. Appiah has come to argue for racial nominalism by admitting the importance of “human folk races,” namely, that they are forms of social identity that do in fact exist (2006, 367). The way in which they are social identities, however, is a problem because we treat them as if there were some biological underpinning to them (2006, 367). The folk theory of race, then, is false because it is based on mistaken beliefs, yet it is nonetheless true that we continue to categorize people along its lines. Appiah’s nominalist view of race aims to reveal how these social identities work by analyzing the labels we use for them. According to Appiah there are three ways that we categorize using folk racial labels: ascription, identification, and treatment, and it takes all three for a given label to be a functioning social identity (2006, 368–370). As a result, we come to live as these identities and look to them as a central resource for constructing our lives. Furthermore, norms of identification and authenticity arise around them (2006, 372). Since there is no biological story that can be told to ground these labels then race is not real (2006, 372). For a critique of Appiah’s modified view that focuses on Appiah 1996 see Ronald R. Sundstrom (2002).

Regarding the debates surrounding eliminitivism, Daniel Wodak (2021) argues that the position should not be tethered to error theory, thereby shifting the definition of eliminitivism to focus not on the vacuity of the term — the fact that it does not refer — but instead on its use. At stake in the debate between conservationists and eliminitivists according to Wodak is not “about racial terms themselves, but whether certain uses of racial terms are wrong” (2022, 589). One upshot of this shift is to more closely align the eliminitivism-conservationism debate with social and political philosophy of language (602). Beyond that, though, is the idea that “it’s time to abandon the eliminitivism-conservationism binary and represent the options as a continuum of views, ordered in terms of how extensively and strongly they endorse or oppose ordinary uses of ‘race’ talk” (603).

Racial constructivism refers to the argument that, even if biological race is false, races have come into existence and continue to exist through “human culture and human decisions” (Mallon 2007, 94). Race constructivists accept the skeptics’ dismissal of biological race but argue that the term still meaningfully refers to the widespread grouping of individuals into certain categories by society, indeed often by the very members of such racial ascriptions. Normatively, race constructivists argue that since society labels people according to racial categories, and since such labeling often leads to race-based differences in resources, opportunities, and well-being, the concept of race must be conserved, in order to facilitate race-based social movements or policies, such as affirmative action, that compensate for socially constructed but socially relevant racial differences. While sharing this normative commitment to race conservationism, racial constructivists can be subdivided into three groups with slightly different accounts of the ontology of race.

Thin constructivism depicts race as a grouping of humans according to ancestry and genetically insignificant, “superficial properties that are prototypically linked with race,” such as skin tone, hair color and hair texture (Mallon 2006, 534). In this way, thin constructivists such as Robert Gooding-Williams (1998), Lucius Outlaw (1990, 1996) and Charles Mills (1998) rely on the widespread folk theory of race while rejecting its scientific foundation upon racial naturalism. Interactive kind constructivism goes further, in arguing that being ascribed to a certain racial category causes the individuals so labeled to have certain common experiences (Mallon 2006, 535; Piper 1992). For instance, if society ascribes you as Black, you are likely to experience difficulty hailing cabs in New York or are more likely to be apprehended without cause by the police (James 2004, 17). Finally, institutional constructivism emphasizes race as a social institution, whose character is specific to the society in which it is embedded and thus cannot be applied across cultures or historical epochs (Mallon 2006, 536). Michael Root (2000, 632) notes that a person ascribed as Black in the United States would likely not be considered Black in Brazil, since each country has very different social institutions regarding the division of humanity into distinct races. Similarly, Paul Taylor (2000) responds to Appiah’s racial skepticism by holding that races, even if biologically unreal, remain real social objects (Mallon 2006, 536–537). Indeed, in a later work Taylor (2004) argues that the term “race” has a perfectly clear referent, that being those people socially ascribed to certain racial categories within the United States, regardless of the widespread social rejection of biological racial naturalism.

Sally Haslanger’s constructivism (2000, 2010, 2019) is not, however, conservationist. She understands races as racialized groups, whose membership requires three criteria. One, members are those who are “observed or imagined” to have certain bodily features that are evidence of certain ancestry from certain geographical locations; two, “having (or being imagined to have)” those features marks members as occupying either a subordinate or privileged social position, thereby justifying that position; and three, the satisfaction of the first two criteria play a role in members’ systemic subordination or privilege (2019, 25–26). Racial identity in such contexts need not focus exclusively on subordination or privilege, as “many forms of racial identity are important, valuable, and in some cases even inevitable responses to racial hierarchy” (2019, 29–30). She worries, however, that even though we should embrace “cultural groups marked by ancestry and appearance” in the short term to fight for justice, she worries about embracing them for the long term (2019, 30).

Constructivism also cleaves along political and cultural dimensions, a distinction owed to Chike Jeffers (Jeffers, 2013, 2019). Haslanger’s view is paradigmatic of political constructivism by understanding the meaning of race as determined by hierarchical relations of power by definition: “race is made real wholly or most importantly by hierarchical relations of power” (Jeffers 2019, 48). Jeffers’ cultural constructivism corrects for political constructivism’s inability to account for race existing after racism, including the idea of racial equality (2013, 421; 2019, 71). Cultural constructivism rejects “the idea that cultural difference is less important than differences in power relations for understanding racial phenomena in the present” (2019, 65). At the extreme, political constructivism argues for, one, differential power relations bring racial difference into existence; two, differential power relations are fundamental for understanding the present reality of race; and three, differential power relations are essential to race, so race will cease to exist in an egalitarian society where appearance and ancestry do not correlate to certain hierarchical positions (2019, 56–57). Jeffers concedes race’s political origin while rejecting the two other ways that power relations define race (2013, 419; 2019, 57–58). The cultural significance of race can be seen in three ways. First, even the emergence of racial categories counts as a cultural shift, insofar as new social contexts are created in which those viewed as being of different races also marks them as having different cultures. Second, there are “novel forms of cultural difference” that emerge in the wake of racial difference. And third, racial groups are shaped culturally by happenings prior to racial formation (2019, 62–63). Jeffers thus writes of Blackness, “What it means to be a Black person, for many of us, including myself, can never be exhausted through reference to problems of stigmatization, discrimination, marginalization, and disadvantage, as real and as large-looming as these factors are in the racial landscape as we know it. There is also joy in blackness, a joy shaped by culturally distinctive situations” (2013, 422).

There are also views that challenge the broad strokes of constructivism while avoiding racial skepticism: Lionel K. McPherson’s deflationary pluralism (2015), Joshua Glasgow’s basic racial realism (2015, with Jonathan M. Woodward, 2019), and Michael O. Hardimon’s deflationary realism (2003, 2014, 2017). McPherson argues that “race” should be replaced with his concept of socioancestry, since “‘race’ talk overall is too ambiguous and contested to be salvaged in the search for a dominant understanding” (2015, 676). He aims to sidestep Appiah’s eliminitivism by claiming that deflationary pluralism “does not maintain that ‘race’ talk is necessarily an error and does not take a hard line about whether races exist” (2015, 675). Socioancestry retains the possibility of “color-conscious social identity” without the burdens of assumptions or confusions about race and racial nature (2015, 686). This is because it is “visible continental ancestry,” rather than race, which is the root of color-consciousness (2015, 690). Socioancestry, then, focuses on visible continental ancestry alone to explain social group formation. Accordingly, socioancestral identities develop “when persons accept (or are ascribed) a social identity because they share a component of continental ancestry that distinctively shapes color-conscious social reality” (2015, 690). McPherson has expanded his view on deflationary pluralism while further expressing his skepticism about philosophical debates concerning race (2024).

Glasgow’s basic racial realism aims to capture our operative meaning of ‘race’ – “the meaning that governs our use of the term, even when we are unaware of it” (2019, 115). Glasgow defines his position in the following way: “Races, by definition, are relatively large groups of people who are distinguished from other groups of people by having certain visible biological traits (such as skin color) to a disproportionate extent.” The position is therefore anti-realist, since it claims that races are neither biologically nor socially real (2019, 117). Glasgow’s position is grounded in judgments about our commitments, believing that we are more willing to give up on the biological basis for race than we are to give up on the idea that there are certain “core features and identities” connected to the idea of race (2019, 127). In other words, disbelieving in the biological reality of race doesn’t lead to eliminitivism. Glasgow holds, however, that it also doesn’t lead to social constructivism. Race is not socially made because, “no matter which social facts we attend to, we can always imagine them disappearing while race stays. And if race is conceptually able to persist across all social practices, then by definition it is not a social phenomenon” (2019, 133). This intuition is based in his focus on our ordinary usage of the term “race,” which is fully captured by visible traits.

Hardimon’s deflationary realism argues that we need four interrelated race concepts to coherently answer the question of what race is to human beings: the racialist concept of race, the minimalist concept of race, the populationist concept of race, and the concept of socialrace (2017, 2–3, 7). The racialist concept of race is the view that there are fixed patterns of race-based moral, intellectual, and cultural characteristics that are heritable, based in an underlying biological essence, correlate to physical characteristics, and form a distinct racial hierarchy (2017, 15–16). Minimalist race “says that people differ in shape and color in ways that correspond to differences in their geographical ancestry. Essentially that is all it says” (2017, 6; see also 2003). It aims to capture in “a nonmalefic way” what the racialist concept of race says that it captures. In other words, it admits of the nonsocial and biological reality of race but in a value-neutral way (2017, 7). Populationist race aims to do the same thing in a more robust and specific way by giving a genetic underpinning to the minimalist conception based on a “geographically separated and reproductively isolated founding population” (2017, 99). This concept is distinguished from cladistic race because it does not require monophyly (2017, 110). Finally, socialrace captures race in terms of its social relations and practices. It refers to “the social groups in racist societies that appear to be racialist races as social groups that falsely appear to be biological groups” (2017, 10; see also 2014). Hardimon argues that it is only through using all four concepts, with the rejection of the first being the basis for the construction of the latter three, that we can actually understand our concept of race.

Hardimon relies on his minimalist race concept, which he has come to call the “minimalist conception of race” (MCR) to argue against Jeffers position of cultural constructivism(2024). Culture is not essential to race, according to Hardimon, because the core of the concept can be captured without it: “The MCR captures the core intuition that races are a specific kind of ancestry group and explains why racial membership is thought to be transmitted through biological descent” (2024, 6). Hardimon introduces the “minimalist conception of ethnicity” (MCE) as a complement to the MCR in order to capture the cultural aspects of identity that Jeffers, incorrectly on Hardimon’s view, attributes to race. These are “differences that are sometimes thought of as racial” (2024, 10). Where the MCR picks out visible physical features, the MCE picks out cultural differences. The “ethnic differences in the sense specified by the MCE are cultural differences that correspond to geographical ancestry” (2024, 10). As complementary ideas, “a minimalist race could lose the pattern of cultural features it has…and remain the same minimalist race” (2024, 10).

The third school of thought regarding the ontology of race is racial population naturalism. This camp suggests that, although racial naturalism falsely attributed cultural, mental, and physical characters to discrete racial groups, it is possible that genetically significant biological groupings could exist that would merit the term races. Importantly, these biological racial groupings would not be essentialist or discrete: there is no set of genetic or other biological traits that all and only all members of a racial group share that would then provide a natural biological boundary between racial groups. Thus, these thinkers confirm the strong scientific consensus that discrete, essentialist races do not exist. However, the criteria of discreteness and essentialism would also invalidate distinctions between non-human species, such as lions and tigers. As Philip Kitcher puts it, “there is no…genetic feature…that separates one species of mosquito or mushroom from another” (Kitcher 2007, 294–6; Cf. Mallon 2007, 146–168). Rather, biological species are differentiated by reproductive isolation, which is relative, not absolute (since hybrids sometimes appear in nature); which may have non-genetic causes (e.g., geographic separation and incompatible reproduction periods or rituals); which may generate statistically significant if not uniform genetic differences; and which may express distinct phenotypes. In effect, if the failure to satisfy the condition of discreteness and essentialism requires jettisoning the concept of race, then it also requires jettisoning the concept of biological species. But because the biological species concept remains epistemologically useful, some biologists and philosophers use it to defend a racial ontology that is “biologically informed but non-essentialist,” one that is vague, non-discrete, and related to genetics, genealogy, geography, and phenotype (Sesardic 2010, 146).

There are three versions of racial population naturalism: cladistic race; socially isolated race; and genetically clustered race. Cladistic races are “ancestor-descendant sequences of breeding populations that share a common origin” (Andreasen 2004, 425). They emerged during human evolution, as different groups of humans became geographically isolated from each other, and may be dying out, if they have not already, due to more recent human reproductive intermingling (Andreasen 1998, 214–6; Cf. Andreasen 2000, S653–S666). Socially isolated race refers to the fact that legal sanctions against miscegenation might have created a genetically isolated African American race in the USA (Kitcher 1999). Finally, defenders of genetically clustered race argue that although only 7% of the differences between any two individuals regarding any one specific gene can be attributed to their membership in one of the commonly recognized racial categories, the aggregation of several genes is statistically related to a small number of racial categories associated with major geographic regions and phenotypes (Sesardic 2010; Kitcher 2007, 304).

The question is whether these new biological ontologies of race avoid the conceptual mismatches that ground eliminativism. The short answer is that they can, but only through human intervention. Socially isolated race faces no mismatch when applied to African Americans, defined as the descendants of African slaves brought to the United States. However, this racial category would not encompass Black Africans. Moreover, because the African American race originated in legally enforced sexual segregation, it is “both biologically real and socially constructed” (Kitcher 2007, 298). Genetic clustering would seem to provide an objective, biological foundation for a broader racial taxonomy, but differences in clustered genes are continuous, not discrete, and thus scientists must decide where to draw the line between one genetically clustered race and another. If they program their computers to distinguish four genetic clusters, then European, Asian, Amerindian, and African groups will emerge; if only two clusters are sought, then only the African and Amerindian “races” remain (Kitcher 2007, 304). Thus, genetic clustering avoids racial mismatch only through the decisions of the scientist analyzing the data. The same problem also confronts cladistic race, since the number of races will vary from nine, at the most recent period of evolutionary reproductive isolation, to just one, if we go back to the very beginning, since all humans were originally Africans. But in addition, cladistic race faces a stronger mismatch by “cross-classifying” groups that we typically think of as part of the same race, for example by linking northeast Asians more closely with Europeans than with more phenotypically similar southeast Asians. Robin Andreasen defends the cladistic race concept by arguing that folk theories of race have themselves generated counter-intuitive cross-classifications, particularly with respect to the Census’s Asian category, which previously excluded Asian Indians and now excludes native Hawaiians and Pacific Islanders. (Andreasen 2005, 100–101; Andreasen 2004, 430–1; Cf. Glasgow 2003, 456–74; Glasgow 2009a, 91–108). But this hardly saves her argument, since the US Census’s history of shifting racial categories and past use of ethnic and religious terms (e.g., Filipino, Hindu, and Korean) to signify races is typically taken as evidence of the social, rather than biological, foundations of race (Espiritu 1992, Chapter 5).

Quayshawn Spencer (2012, 2014, 2019) is resistant to arguments that cladistic subspecies are a viable biological candidate for race (2012, 203). Instead, he defends a version of biological racial realism that understands “biologically real” as capturing “all of the entities that are used in empirically successful biology…and that adequately rules out all of the entities that are not” (2019, 77; see also 95). Spencer argues that such an entity exists and can be found in the US government’s Office of Management and Budget (OMB) and its racial classifications. The basis for this claim is that population genetics has identified five distinctive “human continental populations” that satisfy the criteria for biological reality (2019, 98; 95). The OMB classifications map onto these continental populations. The importance of the OMB is that its ubiquity in our lives means that one of the primary ways that we talk about race is through its categories. Spencer highlights this centrality when he points out the ways that Americans self-report their races correspond to the parameters of the OMB classifications (2019, 83–85). Spencer is pluralist about race talk, however, meaning that OMB race is just one dominant meaning of race, while there is no single dominant meaning among users of the term (2019, 213).

In each case, racial population naturalism encounters problems in trying to demarcate discrete boundaries between different biological populations. If discreteness is indispensable to a human racial taxonomy, then mismatches can only be avoided, if at all, through human intervention. But as noted above, biological species are also not genetically discrete, and thus boundaries between non-human species must also be imposed through human intervention. And just as the demarcation of non-human species is justified through its scientific usefulness, so too are human racial categories justified. For instance, Andreason contends that a cladistic race concept that divides northeastern from southeastern Asians is scientifically useful for evolutionary research, even if it conflicts with the folk concept of a unified Asian race. In turn, the concepts of genetically clustered and socially isolated race may remain useful for detecting and treating some health problems. Ian Hacking provides a careful argument in favor of the provisional use of American racial categories in medicine. Noting that racial categories do not reflect essentialist, uniform differences, he reiterates the finding that there are statistically significant genetic differences among different racial groups. As a result, an African American is more likely to find a bone marrow match from a pool of African American donors than from a pool of white donors. Thus, he defends the practice of soliciting African American bone marrow donors, even though this may provide fodder to racist groups who defend an essentialist and hierarchical conception of biological race (Hacking 2005, 102–116; Cf. Kitcher 2007, 312–316). Conversely, Dorothy Roberts emphasizes the dangers of using racial categories within medicine, suggesting that it not only validates egregious ideas of biological racial hierarchy but also contributes to conservative justifications for limiting race-based affirmative action and even social welfare funding, which supposedly would be wasted on genetically inferior minority populations. In effect, race-based medicine raises the specter of a new political synthesis of colorblind conservatism with biological racialism (Roberts 2008, 537–545). However, Roberts’s critique fails to engage the literature on the statistical significance of racial categories for genetic differences. Moreover, she herself acknowledges that many versions of colorblind conservatism do not rely at all on biological justifications.

A distinct issue regarding racial populations is broached by Michael Diamond-Hunter (2024). He juxtaposes two trends within the philosophy of biology, one dealing with the biological reality of race (biological racial realism) and the other dealing with biological populations, writing, “What is important to note is that philosophical arguments in support of biological racial realism take (either implicitly or explicitly) the notion that racial groups can be more-or-less best understood as biological populations” (2024, 2). That is,“biological races” are just “biologically meaningful populations.”

Diamond-Hunter looks to Millstein’s Causal Interactionist Population Concept (CIPC), which has the benefit of both being less ill-defined than many other population concepts, as well as not simply presupposing that race is a viable biological grouping (2024, 4). The question then becomes, can the CIPC account for race? A counterintuitive ramification is that while races may or not be human populations, human individuals do not have races (2024, 14).

3. Race versus Ethnicity

Stephen Cornell and Douglas Hartmann (1998) provide a helpful discussion of the differences between the concepts of race and ethnicity. Relying on social constructivism, they define race as “a human group defined by itself or others as distinct by virtue of perceived common physical characteristics that are held to be inherent…Determining which characteristics constitute the race…is a choice human beings make. Neither markers nor categories are predetermined by any biological factors” (Cornell and Hartmann 1998, 24). Ethnicity, conversely, is defined as a sense of common ancestry based on cultural attachments, past linguistic heritage, religious affiliations, claimed kinship, or some physical traits (1998, 19). Racial identities are typically thought of as encompassing multiple ethnic identities (Cornell and Hartmann 1998, 26). Thus, people who are racially categorized as Black may possess a variety of ethnic identities based either on African national or cultural markers (e.g., Kenyan, Igbo, Zulu) or the newer national, sub-national, or trans-national identities created through the mixing of enslaved populations in the Americas (e.g., African American, Haitian, West Indian).

Cornell and Hartmann outline five additional characteristics that distinguish race from ethnicity: racial identity is typically externally imposed by outsiders, as when whites created the negro race to homogenize the multiple ethnic groups they conquered in Africa or brought as slaves to America; race is a result of early globalization, when European explorers “discovered” and then conquered peoples with radically different phenotypical traits; race typically involves power relations, from the basic power to define the race of others to the more expansive power to deprive certain racial groups of social, economic, or political benefits; racial identities are typically hierarchical, with certain races being perceived as superior to others; and racial identity is perceived as inherent, something individuals are born with (1998, 27–29).

Race and ethnicity differ strongly in the level of agency that individuals exercise in choosing their identity. Individuals rarely have any choice over their racial identity, due to the immediate visual impact of the physical traits associated with race. Individuals are thought to exercise more choice over ethnic identification, since the physical differences between ethnic groups are typically less striking, and since individuals can choose whether or not to express the cultural practices associated with ethnicity. So an individual who phenotypically appears white with ancestors from Ireland can more readily choose whether to assert their Irish identity (by celebrating St. Patrick’s Day) than whether to choose their white identity (Cornell and Hartmann 1998, 29–30). Moreover, Mary Waters (1990) argues that the high level of intermarriage among white Americans from various national ancestries grants their children significant “ethnic options” in choosing with which of their multiple heritages to identify. Waters (1999) and Philip Kasinitz (1992) document how phenotypically Black West Indian immigrants exercise agency in asserting their ethnic identity in order to differentiate themselves from native-born African Americans, but discrimination and violence aimed at all Black individuals, regardless of ethnicity, strongly constrains such agency.The greater constraints on racial identity stem from the role of informal perceptions, discriminatory social action, and formal laws imposing racial identity, such as Census categorization (Nobles 2000), the infamous “hypodescent” laws, which defined people as Black if they had one drop of African blood (Davis 1991), and judicial decisions such as the “prerequisite cases,” which determined whether specific immigrants could be classified as white and thus eligible for naturalized citizenship (Lopez 1996).

The line between race and ethnicity gets blurred in the case of Asians and Latinos in the United States. Yen Le Espiritu (1992) notes that Asian American racial identity, which of course encompasses a remarkable level of ethnic diversity, results from a combination of external assignment and agency, as when Asians actively respond to anti-Asian discrimination or violence through political action and a sense of shared fate. Consequently, Espiritu uses the term “panethnicity” to describe Asian American identity, a concept which has racial connotations, given the role of “racial lumping” together of members of diverse Asian ethnicities into a single racial group defined by phenotypical traits. Thus, she declares that “African Americans [are] the earliest and most developed pan-ethnic group in the United States” (1992, 174). Hispanic or Latino identity exhibits traits similar to pan-ethnicity. Indeed, unlike Asian identity, Hispanic identity is not even a formal racial identity under the Census. However, informal perceptions, formal laws, and discrimination based on physical appearance nevertheless tend to lump together various nationalities and ethnicities that share some connection to Latin America (Rodriquez 2000). Moreover, scholars have noted that Jewish (Brodkin 1998) and Irish people (Ignatiev 1995) were once were considered distinct, non-white races but are now considered to be racially white ethnic groups, partly by exercising agency in distancing themselves from African Americans exercising political power. Thus, it is conceivable that groups today considered to be sociological racial groups could transform into something more like an ethnic group. For this reason, Blum describes Hispanics and Asians as incompletely racialized groups (Blum 2002, 149–155).

A robust philosophical debate has emerged regarding the status of Hispanic or Latino identity with regard to race, with at least four distinct positions having taken shape. First, Jorge J. E. Gracia (2000, 2005, 2008) defends the view that ‘Hispanic’ names a shared ethnic identity, within which different Hispanic individuals can be of different races. Such an identity, he argues, is rooted in Hispania: the Iberian peninsula, and is a product of the relations between the inhabitants of the Iberian peninsula in 1492 and its colonies in the Americas and their descendents, the enslaved Africans that the Iberians brought to the Americas, and the original Indigenous populations of the Americas.

Second, Linda Martín Alcoff, in disagreement with Gracia, emphasizes the “racialized nature of Latino ethnicity” (2005a, 543). Beyond the claim that there is no way to remove the racialized aspect of this group’s identity, she argues that ‘Latino’ should be preferred to ‘Hispanic’ with regard to the naming of the group (2005b). This latter claim is elaborated through the idea that political considerations need to be attended to beyond merely historical ones, as Gracia claims. In order to capture the racialized ethnicity position she is articulating she appeals to David Theo Goldberg’s concept of ethnorace to describe Latin identity (2006, 246; 2009).

Third, Alejandro Arango and Adam Burgos argue that Latinidad ought not to be primarily understood as an ethnicity, a race, or an ethnorace because “None of these captures the complexity of Latinidad, the myriad ways that it is lived, known, dealt with, and understood by both ingroup and outgroup members” (2022, 2). Race and ethnicity are retained as secondary categories always available as context demands, but are no longer uniformly sufficient, as “the plasticity and multidimensionality of Latinidad overflows those extant categories” (2022, 2).

Lastly, Jorge Garcia (2001, 2006) challenges all of these approaches, arguing that the diversity of individual experiences undermines the use of any label to capture a meaningful form of collective identity for the group. Christina Beltran (2010) does not try to paper over the diversity within Latinidad, which she portrays as a pluralistic, fragmented, and agonistic form of political action.

4. Race in Moral, Political and Legal Philosophy

Three strands in moral, political, and legal philosophy are pertinent to the concept of race. The first examines the broader conceptual and methodological questions regarding the moral status of race and how to theorize racial justice; the second normatively assesses specific policies or institutional forms that seek to redress racial inequality, such as affirmative action, racially descriptive representation, colorblindness in law and policy, residential racial segregation, and racism in the criminal justice system and policing; and the third focuses on specific forms of racism, racial injustice, and oppression.

4.1: Theorizing Racial Justice

Lawrence Blum, Anthony Appiah, and Tommie Shelby articulate indispensable positions in addressing the moral status of the concept of race. Blum (2002) examines both the concept of race and the problem of racism. He argues that “racism” be restricted to two referents: inferiorization, or the denigration of a group due to its putative biological inferiority; and antipathy, or the “bigotry, hostility, and hatred” towards another group defined by its putatively inherited physical traits (2002, 8). These two moral sins deserve this heightened level of condemnation associated with the term racism, because they violate moral norms of “respect, equality, and dignity” and because they are historically connected to extreme and overt forms of racial oppression (2002, 27). But because these connections make “racism” so morally loaded a term, it should not be applied to “lesser racial ills and infractions” that suggest mere ignorance, insensitivity or discomfort regarding members of different groups (28), since doing so will apply a disproportionate judgment against the person so named, closing off possible avenues for fruitful moral dialogue.

Due to the historical connection between racism and extreme oppression, Blum argues against using the term race, since he rejects its biological foundation. Instead, he advocates using the term “racialized group” to denote those socially constructed identities whose supposedly inherited common physical traits are used to impose social, political, and economic costs. To Blum, “racialized group” creates distance from the biological conception of race and it admits of degrees, as in the case of Latinos, whom Blum describes as an “incompletely racialized group” (2002, 151). This terminological shift, and its supposed revelation of the socially constructed character of physiognomically defined identities, need not require the rejection of group-specific policies such as affirmative action. Members of sociologically constructed racialized identities suffer real harms, and laws might have to distinguish individuals according to their racialized identities in order to compensate for such harms. Nevertheless, Blum remains ambivalent about such measures, arguing that even when necessary they remain morally suspect (2002, 97). The call to replace the term “race” with “racialized group” has been recently reinforced in a series of articles by Adam Hochman (2017, 2019a, 2019b). Like Blum, Hochman emphasizes that the term “race” cannot be detached from its historical connection to perceived biological traits. But Hochman goes further to emphasize how “racialized group” better depicts the process through which groups become depicted as a putative biological group, thereby allowing for the possibility that groups that may have been racialized in the past or in other contexts can become deracialized in different eras or settings.

Similar ambivalence about the term “race” is also expressed by Anthony Appiah, earlier discussed regarding the metaphysics of race. While his metaphysical racial skepticism was cited as grounding his normative position of eliminativism, Appiah is “against races” but “for racial identities” (1996). Because of a wide social consensus that races exist, individuals are ascribed to races regardless of their individual choices or desires. Moreover, racial identity remains far more salient and costly than ethnic identity (1996, 80–81). As a result, mobilization along racial lines is justifiable, in order to combat racism. But even at this point, Appiah still fears that racial identification may constrain individual autonomy by requiring members of racial groups to behave according to certain cultural norms or “scripts” that have become dominant within a specific racial group. Appiah thus concludes, “Racial identity can be the basis of resistance to racism; but even as we struggle against racism…let us not let our racial identities subject us to new tyrannies” (1996, 104). This residual ambivalence, to recall the metaphysical discussions of the last section, perhaps ground Mallon’s contention that Appiah remains an eliminativist rather than a racial constructivist, since ideally Appiah would prefer to be free of all residual constraints entailed by even socially constructed races.

Tommie Shelby responds to the ambivalence of Appiah and Blum by distinguishing classical Black nationalism, which rested upon an organic Black identity, with pragmatic Black nationalism, based on an instrumental concern with combating antiblack racism (2005, 38–52; 2003, 666–668). Pragmatic nationalism allows Black people to generate solidarity across class or cultural lines, not just through the modus vivendi of shared interests but upon a principled commitment to racial equality and justice (2005, 150–154). As a result, Black solidarity is grounded upon a principled response to common oppression, rather than some putative shared identity (2002), thus mitigating the dangers of biological essentialism and tyrannical cultural conformity that Appiah associates with race and racial identities. Anna Stubblefield (2005) provides an alternative defense of Black solidarity by comparing it to familial commitments.

Shelby (2005, 7) briefly mentions that his pragmatic, political version of Black solidarity is compatible with John Rawls’s Political Liberalism, but his more detailed defense of the ideal social contract method of Rawls’s A Theory of Justice for theorizing racial justice has drawn substantial controversy (Shelby 2004). Elizabeth Anderson eschews ideal theory for analyzing racial justice because it assumes motivational and cognitive capacities beyond those of ordinary humans; it risks promoting ideal norms (like colorblindness) under unjust conditions that require race-specific policies; and its idealizing assumptions, like an original position in which parties do not know relevant personal and social racial facts, precludes recognition of historical and present racial injustice. She instead uses a normative framework of democratic equality to ground her moral imperative of integration.

Charles Mills, extending his critique of how early modern social contract thinking obfuscates racial injustice (1997), fears that Rawls’s ideal theory can similarly serve as an ideology that whitewashes non-white oppression (Mills 2013). But rather than jettisoning a contractarian approach entirely, Mills develops a model of a non-ideal contract, in which the parties do not know their own racial identities but are aware of their society’s history of racial exploitation and its effects. Because the parties know of racial hierarchy but do not know if they will be its beneficiaries or victims, Mills hypothesizes that they will rationally agree to racial reparations as a form of corrective or rectificatory justice (Pateman and Mills 2007, Chapters 3, 4, 8).

Shelby responds that, while Rawls’s ideal theory of justice excludes a theory of rectification because it is not comprehensive, rectificatory justice is not only complementary but in fact presupposes an ideal theory that can clarify when injustices have occurred and need to be rectified. More importantly, Shelby suggests that complying with rectificatory justice through racial reparations could well leave Black people living in a society that nevertheless remains racially unjust in other ways. For this reason, Shelby concludes that ideal theory remains indispensable (2013).

Christopher Lebron (2013, 28–42) also suggests that the approaches of Rawls and Mills are complementary, but in a very different way. He argues that Rawls’s focus on the basic structure of society provides explanatory mechanisms through which white supremacy persists, something unspecified in earlier work by Mills (2003). And in sharp contrast to Shelby (2013), Lebron criticizes Mills for rehabilitating Rawlsian contract thinking, since even a non-ideal form eliminates the epistemological advantage of a non-white perspective on white supremacy. Instead of reformulating contractarian thinking to fit the needs of racial justice, Lebron instead focuses on analyzing how “historically evolved power” and “socially embedded power” perpetuate racial injustice.

Kiran Banerjee and Abraham Singer (2017), conversely, claim that Rawls’s focus on the basic structure of society precludes any strong stance against non-state discrimination by meso-level institutions. However, Sonu Bedi (2014) argues that even Rawls’s formulation of formal equality of opportunity, a more modest variant than fair equality of opportunity, justifies protections against horizontal racial discrimination practiced by non-state actors, thereby justifying a more robust form of anti-discrimination law embodied in the South African constitution but not the US Constitution. Finally, Dale Matthew (2017) defends the value of Rawls’s work for racial justice. While conceding that Rawls’s framework may be inadequate for guarding against the development of racial injustice, Matthew contends that, contra Mills, it does provide valuable resources for rectifying racial injustice after it emerges.

The question of whether Rawls’s theory is compatible with efforts to rectify racial injustice frames an important debate over the issue of affirmative action. Robert Taylor (2009) argues that Rawls’s theory is compatible with only certain forms of affirmative action but not others. Taylor begins by cataloging five varieties of affirmative action: (1) Formal Equality of Opportunity, or the prohibition of racial or gender discrimination; (2) Aggressive Formal Equality of Opportunity (sensitivity training, state enforcement of non-discrimination; (3) Compensating Support (special training programs, apprenticeships, and tutoring designed to compensate for identity-based disadvantages; (4) Soft Quotas (bonus points for individuals from disadvantaged groups; and (5) Hard Quotas (positions or seats reserved for members of disadvantaged groups. Under the full-compliance conditions of Ideal Theory, Taylor argues that Categories 3–5 are prohibited, while Categories 1–2 are required to guarantee equality of opportunity, though one wonders whether these two are even meaningfully understood as forms of affirmative action. Taylor then argues that under conditions of partial compliance Non-Ideal Theory, which must be minimally compatible with Ideal Theory, Category 3 becomes permissible. Dale Matthew (2015) contends that Category 3 may be required under ideal conditions, in order to preclude the emergence of private discrimination. He then argues that under non-ideal conditions, Categories 4-5 could be justified if Category 3 measures are not being undertaken.

4.2 Policies of Institutional Redress

The debate over Rawls and affirmative action segues into the second strand of practical philosophy devoted to race, which focuses on policies such as affirmative action, race-conscious electoral districting, and colorblindness in policy and law. The literature on affirmative action is immense, and may be divided into approaches that focus on compensatory justice, distributive justice, critiques of the concept of merit, and diversity of perspective. Alan Goldman (1979) generally argues against affirmative action, since jobs or educational opportunities as a rule should go to those most qualified. Only when a specific individual has been victimized by racial or other discrimination can the otherwise irrelevant factor of race be used as a compensatory measure to award a position or a seat at a university. Ronald Fiscus (1992) rejects the compensatory scheme in favor of a distributive justice argument. He claims that absent the insidious and invidious effects of a racist society, success in achieving admissions to selective universities or attractive jobs would be randomly distributed across racial lines. Thus, he concludes that distributive justice requires the racially proportional distribution of jobs and university seats. Of course, Fiscus’s argument displaces the role of merit in the awarding of jobs or university admissions, but this point is addressed by Iris Young (1990, Chapter 7), who argues that contemporary criteria of merit, such as standardized testing and educational achievement, are biased against disadvantaged racial and other groups, and rarely are functionally related to job performance or academic potential. Finally, Michel Rosenfeld (1991) turns away from substantive theories of justice in favor of justice as reversibility, a position influenced by the “Discourse Ethics” of Jürgen Habermas (1990), which defines justice not by the proper substantive awarding of goods but as the result of a fair discursive procedure that includes all relevant viewpoints and is free of coercive power relations. Thus, affirmative action is justified as an attempt to include racially diverse viewpoints. All of these positions are summarily discussed in a useful debate format in Cohen and Sterba (2003).

The issues of race-conscious electoral districting and descriptive racial representation have also garnered substantial attention. Race-conscious districting is the practice of drawing geographically based electoral districts in which the majority of voters are Black. Descriptive racial representation holds that Black people are best represented by Black politicians. Iris Marion Young (1990, 183–191) provides a spirited defense of descriptive representation for racial minorities, grounded in their experiences of “oppression, the institutional constraint on self-determination”, and domination “the institutional constraint on self-determination” (1990, 37). Anne Phillips (1995) furthers this position, arguing that representatives who are members of minority racial groups can enhance legislative deliberation. Melissa Williams (1998) also defends the deliberative contribution of descriptive racial representation, but adds that minority constituents are more likely to trust minority representatives, since both will be affected by laws that overtly or covertly discriminate against minority racial groups. Finally, Jane Mansbridge (1999) carefully demonstrates why a critical mass of minority representatives is needed, in order to adequately advocate for common minority interests as well as to convey the internal diversity within the group. In a later work, Young (2000) addresses critics who argue that descriptive representation relies upon group essentialism, since members of a racial group need not all share the same interests or opinions. In response, Young suggests that members of the same racial group do share the same “social perspective” grounded in common experiences, similar to the interactive kind variant of racial constructivism discussed earlier. But because it is unclear that Black individuals are more likely to share common experiences than common interests or opinions, Michael James prioritizes using race-conscious districting to create Black racial constituencies which can hold Black or non-Black representatives accountable to Black interests (James 2011). Abigail Thernstrom (1987) condemns race-conscious districting for violating the original principles behind the 1965 Voting Rights Act and the 15th Amendment, by promoting the election of Black representatives rather than simply guaranteeing Black voters the right to cast ballots. J. Morgan Kousser (1999) responds that race-conscious districting simply reflects the right to cast a “meaningful” vote, as implied by the 15th Amendment protection against not only the denial but also the “abridgment” of the right to vote. Lani Guinier (1994) compellingly suggests that instead of drawing majority Black districts, we should adopt a more proportional electoral system that facilitate the electoral strength of racial and other minorities. Michael James (2004) suggests that alternative electoral systems facilitate not only descriptive racial representation but also democratic deliberation across racial lines.

A general advantage of using alternative electoral systems to enhance minority racial representation is that they are technically colorblind, not requiring lawmakers or judges to group citizens according to their racial identities. The general value of colorblindness is an ongoing topic of debate within legal philosophy. Drawing on Justice John Marshall Harlan’s famous dissent in Plessy v. Ferguson, and a not-uncontroversial interpretation of the origins of the equal protection clause, Andrew Kull (1992) argues that contemporary American statutory and constitutional law should strive to be colorblind and combat racial inequality without dividing citizens into different racial groups. Ian Haney Lopez (2006, 143–162), on the other hand, fears “colorblind white dominance,” whereby facially race-neutral laws leave untouched the race-based inequality that operates within American political, legal, and economic structures. Elizabeth Anderson (2010) provides a trenchant critique of colorblindness as a normative standard for law, policy, or ethics. Moreover, she provides a compelling philosophical analysis of the origins and moral status of contemporary racial segregation, a topic that, apart from the work of Owen Fiss (2003), has garnered much less philosophical attention than affirmative action and racially descriptive representation. Racial segregation and the potential for integration have garnered much less philosophical attention than affirmative action and racially descriptive representation. Bernard Boxill (1992) offers a treatment of busing and self-segregation, while Howard McGary (1999) offers a clarification of integration and separation. Iris Young (2002, chapter 6) treats residential segregation in the context of regional democracy, while Owen Fiss (2003) analyzes it in the context of the legacy of racism. Anderson herself (2010) argues for the moral imperative of integration, with Tommie Shelby (2014) and Ronald Sundstrom (2013) offering critical responses to Anderson’s argument. Sundstrom’s has more recently written at book length on race and housing policy (2024), while Shelby (2016) devotes considerable space to issues of segregation and integration, and race and the criminal justice system. Additionally, Shelby’s latest book considers the idea of prison abolition (2022). Andrew Valls (2018, chapter 6) has also written on the subject.

In recent years, the problem of racism within policing and criminal justice in the United States has attracted intense popular and scholarly attention. Mathias Risse and Richard Zeckhauser (2004) offer a qualified defense of racial profiling that engages both utilitarian and non-consequentialist reasoning. Annabelle Lever’s (2005) objection and response prompted a subsequent round of debate (Risse 2007, Lever 2007). Michelle Alexander (2010) famously depicted the contemporary American criminal justice system as the “New Jim Crow,” for its intense racial disparities. Naomi Zack (2015) provides a trenchant critique of racial profiling and police homicide. David Boonin (2011) defends racial profiling on pragmatic grounds while Adam Hosein (2018) argues against it for reasons of political equality. Shelby (2016) offers a justification of Black resistance based in the unjust legacy of racial segregation while deepening his earlier critique of Anderson’s view.

4.3 Racism

Though accounts of racism play a role in the previous two subsections, it is worth addressing on its own in more depth. Kwame Anthony Appiah distinguishes between racialism and racism, and then between extrinsic racism and intrinsic racism. Racialism is the view that “there are heritable characteristics, possessed by members of our species, that allow us to divide them into a small set of races, in such a way that the members of these races share certain traits and tendencies with each other that they do not share with members of any other race. These traits and tendencies characteristic of a race constitute, on the racialist view, a sort of racial essence” (1990, 4–5). Racialism of this sort leads directly to both forms of racism according to Appiah.

On the one hand, extrinsic racism occurs when individuals “make moral distinctions between members of different races because they believe that the racial essence entails certain morally relevant qualities…Members of different races differ in respects that warrant the differential treatment” (1990, 5). On the other hand, intrinsic racists “differentiate morally between members of different races because they believe that each race has a different moral status, quite independent of the moral characteristics entailed by its racial essence” (1990, 5–6). Both extrinsic racism and intrinsic racism are wrong according to Appiah because they depend on racialism and racialism is wrong (1990, 16).

On this view, racial prejudice is “the deformation of rationality in judgment that characterizes those whose racism is more than a theoretical attachment to certain propositions about race” (1990, 8). Propositional racists may be so because, living in a racist culture, they have false moral beliefs but lack the racist disposition that would push them into having racial prejudice (1990, 9). Their cognitive incapacity, to use Appiah’s term, could be corrected if the falsity of their beliefs is pointed out.

As illustrated by Appiah’s influential account, the location of racism as a phenomenon has been central to philosophical debates. Appiah highlights propositions and dispositions, and so situates racism within our beliefs.

J.L.A. Garcia disputes that belief is central to racism, proposing to “conceive of racism as fundamentally a vicious kind of racially based disregard for the welfare of certain people” (1996, 6). Hatred and ill will are primary, with the result that “racism, then, is something that essentially involves not our beliefs and their rationality or irrationality, but our wants, intentions, likes, and dislikes and their distance from the moral virtues” (1996, 6). Our racist attitudes then infect our actions (1996, 9–10). This “volitional” account is in turn disputed by Tommie Shelby.

Shelby returns racism to belief, but in a different way than Appiah. First, Shelby objects to treating racism as a thick concept, claiming that the term’s ordinary usage is so muddled that moral appraisal lacks a clear target (2002, 412). As a remedy, Shelby aims for a philosophical reconstruction in order to illuminate the history, structure, psychological mechanisms, and social consequences of racism (2012, 413). Such a reconstruction yields two main claims. First, beliefs return to their privileged explanatory position — how can we know about a person’s intentions and attitudes without knowing something about their beliefs? The attitudinal dislike that Garcia focuses on needs an additional why that is found in belief. In other words, we need to know about belief to know whether or not to classify the dislike as racist (2002, 414–415).

Second, racism is a form of ideology, where ideologies are “widely accepted illusory systems of belief that function to establish or reinforce structures of social oppression” (2002, 415). They serve a legitimating function. The two claims are connected because the ideological background is what can give rise to the sort of person who Garcia’s account ignores but who is central for understanding how racism works. Focusing just on attitudes – on “heart” – “can blind us to the ways in which seemingly ‘innocent’ people can often be unwittingly complicitous in racial oppression” (2002, 418). See Garcia 2023 for a defense of his view against Shelby’s criticisms.

Shelby’s view makes space to understand the sort of racist who, due to ideological influence, holds sincere racist beliefs but lacks ill will – they simply learned as a child what they now as an adult continue to uncritically believe as fact (2002, 418). Rima Basu confronts a related issue, one in which there seem to not be any epistemic faults within a belief that nonetheless appears racist: “the task of the paper is to take a paradigmatically racist belief, e.g., black diners do not tip well, and see what resources a supposedly rational racist can muster in defense of the epistemic grounds of such a belief in order to demonstrate that even the best argument for how the belief might be rationally held does not succeed” (2018, 2500). Basu ultimately argues that given non-ideal conditions we ought to reject the idea that properly held beliefs escape moral obligation because they lack voluntary control (2018, 2513). Why? Because “the world is an unjust place and there may be many morally objectionable beliefs that it justifies. As a result, the evidence might be stacked in favour of racist beliefs. The world we inhabit is a racist one, so it is no surprise then that some of our beliefs are racist as well” (2018, 2512–2513).

There are additional conceptions of racism worth noting here, such as Joshua Glasgow’s idea that racism is fundamentally about disrespect (2009b). Alberto G. Urquidez argues that the assumption in favor of “conservativism” in the literature – that is, “the presupposition that ordinary usage should be privileged in some way or another” when arguing over how to conceive of racism – is mistaken, and makes the case for a revisionist conception (2020, 231).

Leonard Harris adopts an actuarial approach to understanding racism, which is an account of who lives, who dies, who has health and who does not, of health risks, probabilities, mortality and morbidity, by race correlated with environments, employment, ownership (2018, 282–283). It captures the transfer of wealth over time (2018, 288). For Harris, racism is “a polymorphous agent of death, premature births, shortened lives, starving children, debilitating theft, abusive larceny, degrading insults, and insulting stereotypes forcibly imposed” (2018, 273). Actuarial racism – racism as a form of necro-being – tracks premature death. It focuses only on consequences, whatever their ultimate causal origin, in sharp contrast to all of the aforementioned conceptions of racism that focus on attitude or belief (2018, 294).

David Haekwon Kim and Ronald R. Sundstrom differentiate racism from xenophobia, arguing that they occupy two conceptually distinct, though of course potentially overlapping, spaces (2014). The latter is defined as civic ostracism, which is different as well from nativism.

Complementary to the debates surrounding the place of belief within racism is a focus on cultural racism. Linda Alcoff argues that the focus on attitudinal racism has pushed cultural racism aside, yet it remains an important locus of analysis. Cultural racism here “refers not only to racism in the sphere of culture but also to a distinct alibi or legitimating ground given to justify exclusion and domination” (2023, 249). Similarly, Lawrence Blum aims to put cultural racism back into the philosophical conversation (2023).

Lastly, there is the issue of structural racism, also sometimes referred to as systemic or institutional racism, in contrast to views of racism that locate racism within individual persons in some way. The views of Shelby and Harris, above, have structural elements to them. Eduardo Bonilla-Silva (2015, 2021, 2022) is the most prominent thinker of structural racism.

5. Race in Continental Philosophy

While the debates in contemporary philosophy of race within the analytic tradition have largely revolved around whether or not races exist along with criteria for determining realness or existence, philosophers working in the Continental traditions have taken up the concept of race along other dimensions (See Bernasconi and Cook 2003 for an overview, and Bernasconi 2022).

5.1 Existentialism and Phenomenology

First, those working within the traditions of Existentialism and Phenomenology have called on Frantz Fanon, Maurice Merleau-Ponty, and Jean-Paul Sartre, among others, to understand how race and functions within our lived, bodily experiences of everyday life. This strand of scholarship focuses on a specific kind of the materiality of race. As Emily S. Lee puts it, “both the social structural and the individual subconscious levels of analysis rely on perceiving the embodiment of race” (2014, 1).

Frantz Fanon has been the primary influence for those understanding race and racism within Existentialism and Phenomenology. In Black Skin, White Masks Fanon writes, “I came into this world anxious to uncover the meaning of things, my soul desirous to be at the origin of the world, and here I am an object among other objects” (2008/1952, 89). Furthermore, this “inferiority is determined by the Other,” by the “white gaze” (2008/1952, 90). Such a position is understood through the schema of the body: “In a white world, the man of color encounters difficulties in elaborating his body schema. The image of one’s body is solely negating. It’s an image in the third person” (2008/1952, 90). Rather than being at home in his own body, and moving “out of habit,” Fanon understands his body as existing primarily as an object for others, requiring him to move “by implicit knowledge” of the rules and norms of that white world (2008/1952, 91)

Fanon critiques Sartre’s understanding of race and racism by pointing out that Sartre understands antiracism as a negative movement that will be overcome (2008/1952, 111–2). Sartre treats antiracism as the transition toward something else and not as an end in itself. Against this view Fanon writes, “Sartre forgets that the Black man suffers in his body quite differently from the white man” (2008/1952, 117). He is trapped by his body schema, “a toy in the hands of the white man” (2008/1952, 119). Tendayi Sithole has articulated Fanon’s Black subject as one that “should be understood from lived experience and the form of living being that is rendered non-existent but being the one that possesses the possibility to emerge. It is the form of live that seeks to break away from survival and more toward the existential condition of having the will to live” (25)

Lewis Gordon draws on both Fanon and Sartre in articulating his Africana existentialism. He distinguishes between Existentialism as a specific historical European movement and philosophies of existence, or existential philosophies, which are preoccupied with “freedom, anguish, responsibility, embodied agency, sociality, and liberation.” These concerns yield a focus on the “lived context of concern” (2000, 10). For Gordon, due to the history of racial oppression of Black peoples, an Africana existential philosophy revolves around the questions, “what does it mean to be a problem, and what is to be understood by Black suffering?” (2000, 8).

According to Gordon, what is sometimes referred to as the “race question” is really a question about the status of Blackness, for “race has emerged, throughout its history, as the question fundamentally of ‘the blacks’ as it has for no other group” (2000, 12). Rather than a denial that other groups have been racialized, the claim instead is that such other racializations have been conditioned on a scale of European personhood to Black subpersonhood (see also Mills 1998, 6–10). Blackness itself has been characterized as “the breakdown of reason” and “an existential enigma” in such a way that to ask after race and racialization is to ask after Blackness in the first instance.

Both Gordon and Zack use Sartre’s notion of bad faith to understand race. We can understand bad faith as the evasion of responsibility and fidelity to human freedom, and an understanding of the human being as a for-itself. Bad faith falsely turns the human being into an object without agency, into an in-itself. For Gordon, antiblack racism conceives of Blackness itself as a problem so as to avoid having to understand Black problems. As a result, actual Black people disappear along with any responsibility to them (1997, 74). Gordon gives the example of The Philadelphia Negro, Du Bois’ sociological study of the residents of Philadelphia’s Seventh Ward. Gordon recounts how those commissioning the study set Du Bois up to fail so that he would only perpetuate the pathologizing of the Black population – presenting Blackness itself as a problem rather than attempt to understand the problems of Black people and communities (2000, 69).

Whereas Gordon uses bad faith to understand antiblack racism, Zack does so to deepen her eliminitivism. For Sartre, authenticity is the antidote to bad faith – to live authentically is to understand and embrace human freedom rather than evade it. Zack’s eliminativism attributes bad faith to those who affirm that racial designations describe human beings when in fact they do not (1993, 3–4). If racial identifications lack adequate support because races do not exist, then identification as mixed race is also done in bad faith. Instead, Zack understands her position of “anti-race” as true authenticity that looks to the future in the name of freedom and resistance to oppression in the name of racelessness (1993, 164).

Embodiment and visibility are central to these views. Gordon understands the body as “our perspective in the world,” which occurs along (at least) three matrices: seeing, being seen, and being conscious of being seen (1997, 71). In an antiblack world this means that the Black body is a form of absence, going unseen in the same manner as Ralph Ellison’s protagonist in Invisible Man (1997, 72–3). George Yancy tells us that he writes from his “lived embodied experience,” which is a “site of exposure” (2008, 65). Black embodiment here is the lens used to critique whiteness and its normative gaze. For Yancy, Black resistance itself decodes and recodes Black embodied existence, affirming the value of the Black body in the face of centuries of white denial (2008, 112–3).

Linda Martín Alcoff offers a phenomenological account of race that highlights a “visual registry,” which is socially and historically constructed and that is “determinant over individual experience” (2006, 194). Like Yancy, Alcoff locates race in embodied lived experience. Drawing on Maurice Merleau-Ponty’s work, Alcoff notes how the way that our perceptual practices are organized affects the way we come to know the world (2006, 188). When race operates through visibility, these ways of normalized perceptual knowing become racialized. As she notes, “racial consciousness works through learned practices and habits of visual discrimination and visual marks on the body…race exists there on the body itself” (2006, 196).

Lee argues that racial meaning fits squarely within the space that a phenomenological framework seeks to explore, namely, the space between the natural and the cultural, the objective and the subjective, and thinking and nonthinking (Lee 2014, 8). Furthermore, a phenomenological approach can illuminate how, even when race is understood as a social construction, it can nonetheless become naturalized through “the sedimentation of racial meaning into the very structures and practices of society” (Lee 2019, xi).

5.2 Genealogy

Second, philosophers building on the work of Michel Foucault have articulated genealogical understandings of race that focus on its historical emergence as a concept and the ways that it has functioned within discourses of knowledge and power.

In his 1975–1976 lectures at the Collège de France, published in English as Society Must Be Defended, Foucault details the emergence of a discourse on race beginning in early 17th Century England. According to Foucault, race war discourse emerges through claims of illegitimacy against the Stuart monarchy. These claims were couched in the language of injustice as well as foreign invasion, in which an Indigenous race is pitted against an invading outsider (2003, 60). Race, at this point, is not a biological concept, instead referring to lineage, custom, and tradition (2003, 77). Only later does this cultural notion of race transform into the scientific notion of race.

Cornel West employs a Foucaultian methodology to produce a genealogy of modern racism (1982). West analyzes how the discourse of modernity came into being to show how central white supremacy is to its practices of knowledge and meaning making (47). By modern discourse he means, “The controlling metaphors, notions, categories, and norms that shape the predominant conception of truth and knowledge in the modern West,” which are driven by the scientific revolution, the Cartesian transformation of philosophy, and the classical revival (50). It is a discourse comprising certain forms of rationality, scientificity, objectivity, and aesthetic and cultural ideals, the parameters of which exclude Black equality from the outset, marking it as unintelligible and illegitimate within the prevailing norms of discourse and knowledge (47–8). Notions of truth and knowledge produced by these three forces are governed by a value-free subject that observes, compares, orders, and measures in order to obtain evidence and make inferences that verify the true representations of reality.

Ladelle McWhorter uses Foucault’s lectures to conduct a genealogy of racism and sexual oppression of a more proximate time and place. According to McWhorter, “racism in twentieth-century Anglo-America [has] to be understood in light of Foucault’s work on normalization,” where racism exists as a crusade against deviance, abnormality, and pathology (2009, 12). Building on Foucault’s analysis of race war discourse McWhorter carries out a genealogy of race, ultimately arguing that race and sexuality “are historically codependent and mutually determinative” (2009, 14). Anglo-American discourse on race is therefore linked to discourses on eugenics, the family, sexual predation, normality, and population management, all of which function within the networks of power that Foucault referred to as biopower (2009, 15). Ann Laura Stoler (1995) offers an extended reconstruction and critique of Foucault’s treatment of race in light of colonialism and empire. Joy James goes even further, arguing that Foucault is not useful for thinking about race at all (1996, chapter 1).

5.3 Psychoanalysis

A third strand of Continental philosophy that discusses race is psychoanalysis. In Female Subjects in Black and White: Race, Psychoanalysis, Feminism (1997) the editors aim for an “an interrogation of the racial boundaries of psychoanalysis” that brings together predominantly white psychoanalytic feminism and African American feminism in a series of dialogues on female subjectivity (1997, 1–2). The volume takes steps toward addressing the “lack of discursive ground for the black female subject” who is situated between “an implicitly white psychoanalytic feminism and an implicitly masculine discourse on race” (1997, 6).

The Psychoanalysis of Race, edited by Christopher Lane (1998), takes a more general approach to the subjects at hand. Lane introduces the volume by writing, “From a psychoanalytic perspective, this collection asks what it means today to invoke ‘race’ and ‘ethnicity’ as concepts organizing our identifications and lives. By highlighting racism’s irrational forms, this collection demonstrates that prejudice can coexist with the greatest support for ethnic and cultural diversity” (1998, 2). While these two volumes deal broadly with the field of psychoanalysis, there is recent work that specifically looks to the psychoanalysis of Jacques Lacan to engage race.

Sheldon George and Derek Hook position their volume, Lacan and Race: Racism, Identity, and Psychoanalytic Theory (2021), with regard to two connected discourses. First, they note that, while Lacanian psychoanalysis has been taken up by many different modes of social theory, issues of race, racism, and racial identification have been conspicuously absent. They seek to remedy that oversight, and believe that Lacan’s work “provides a unique and refined conceptual frame of ideas and concepts that are vital to renewed understanding of various psychical, political, and social instantiations of race” (2021, 1). Second, they see a Lacanian approach to race as being able to speak to urgent contemporary concerns, able to better make sense of them than the extant options, such as “white fragility, privilege theory, the struggle for social or mutual recognition, the need for tolerance and empathy, investigations of implicit and unconscious forms of bias, and Foucaultian analyses of power and biopolitics” (2021, 1).

Jack Black further takes up that project in The Psychosis of Race: A Lacanian Approach to Racism and Racialization, arguing for the essential entwining of race and racism in parallel to the impossibility of separating the Symbolic and the Real within Lacan’s conceptual apparatus (2023, 6). More specifically, he argues that, “it is in our reliance on race to demarcate, divide, and differentiate the human population that our understanding of race is both secured and perpetuated through acts of racism” (2023, 5–6).

Another way that psychoanalysis has been used to engage with analyses of race comes through the use of Freud’s concept – via Jean-François Lyotard – of libidinal economy within Afro-Pessimism. Jared Sexton writes of the concept’s use “Afro-Pessimism seeks to decenter, without diminishing, the analysis of political economy by discerning the libidinal economy that underwrites and sutures its dynamics” (2016, n.p.).

5.4 Deconstruction

Within the discourse of deconstruction Jacques Derrida’s essay “Racism’s Last Word” (1985) is central, in which Derrida writes, “APARTHEID––may that remain the name, from now on, the unique appellation for the ultimate racism in the world, the last of many” (291, his capitalization). Linking racism and language, he writes, “there’s no racism without a language. The point is not that acts of racial violence are only words but rather that they have to have a word. Even though it offers the excuse of blood, color, birth–or rather, because it uses naturalist and sometimes creationist discourse–racism always betrays the perversion of a man, the ‘talking animal’” (1985, 292).

Written in the same time period yet lost for decades, Derrida’s Geschlecht III: Sex, Race, Nation, Humanity (2020) is the third installment of four of Derrida’s engagement and analysis of Heidegger’s use of the German Geschlecht, which has no direct translation into either French or English, but means alternatively and ambiguously sex, nation, race, generation, humanity, or lineage. The text is connected to “Racism’s Last Word” through its arguments surrounding the necessary violence of demarcation and the ambiguity of place.

Despite writing only these texts on race and racism, Barnor Hesse points out that Derrida late in his life avowed that deconstruction itself was a deconstruction of racism (2023, 5). Using that enigmatic claim as his starting point, Hesse interrogates the varied relationship between deconstruction and decoloniality (2023, 7). This “deconstruction of the decolonial” ultimately yields both “the colonial-racial foundationalism of the West” as well as its “colonial-racial undecidability” (2023, 31).

Lastly, there has been additional recent work engaging race through major figures within Continental philosophy that does not fit into the above three strands but are worth mentioning, such as Elisabeth Paquette on Badiou and race (2020) and Tina Chanter on Jacques Rancière and race (2017).

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