Ecology

First published Wed Feb 21, 2024

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Alkistis Elliott-Graves replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

Ecology is the scientific discipline that studies interactions between individual organisms and their environments, including interactions with both conspecifics and members of other species. Its importance has been recognized at least since Darwin’s publication of Origin of Species, which categorized ecological interactions as “the struggle for existence”. Since then, there has been an ongoing endeavor to systematize investigations of this struggle into a scientific discipline. Historically, philosophers paid little attention to ecology, compared to other scientific disciplines, yet this has begun to change, as it is becoming increasingly obvious that examining ecological systems is interesting in itself and can also provide insights for philosophy of science more generally. This entry will cover a selection of topics that are internal to ecology, in the sense that they only exist in an ecological context (§2) along with a selection of topics that are already discussed in philosophy of science yet are particularly interesting when examined from an ecological standpoint.

1. What is (the scientific discipline called) Ecology?

The term “Ecology” is attributed to Ernst Haeckel, who coined it to provide a name for the science of what Darwin called the “Struggle for Existence” (Cooper 2003). This struggle was a focal point of early evolutionary thought as it constituted an important driving force of evolution by natural selection (Cooper 2003; Justus 2021). Organisms struggled in their environments, competing over scarce resources. The study of the outcomes of these struggles eventually developed into Evolutionary Biology, while the study of the struggles themselves developed into the discipline of Ecology. As the science of the struggle for existence matured into “Ecology” proper, several new struggles emerged, this time for its practitioners rather than the organisms they studied. These struggles have shaped the discipline since its beginnings, influencing the establishment of concepts, methods and epistemic norms (Elliott-Graves 2019, 2023; Justus 2021; Kingsland 1985 [1995]; Peters 1991).

The underlying cause of many of these struggles comes from the complexity of ecological systems. Ecological systems are made up of numerous diverse species and abiotic factors (e.g., water, nitrogen, phosphorus etc.), all of which interact dynamically with each other giving rise to events, phenomena and behaviors that are difficult to investigate scientifically. Some of the most important of these difficulties are:

  1. the fact that ecological phenomena transcend levels, scales and hierarchies (see §2.1 & §3.4),
  2. data is difficult to obtain and often of poor quality (despite the best efforts of ecologists) (see §3.2 & §3.5),
  3. generalizations are contingent and have limited scope (see §3.3),
  4. the discipline of ecology combines both “pure” and “applied” research traditions, which have different (often competing) research goals and norms and (see §2.4 & §3.7)
  5. epistemic and non-epistemic goals and values coexist in many research areas, especially those in the applied tradition, where they are often interwoven with policy-making (see §2.4 & §3.7).

From a philosophical point of view, these struggles make the discipline of Ecology particularly interesting. The phenomena ecologists investigate along with the challenges they face can teach us valuable lessons about how science, especially the science of complex systems, works. In addition, philosophical approaches can be fruitful for ecological research (see for example Diamond 1986; Levins 1966; Odenbaugh 2007; Sarkar 2014a; Trappes et al. 2022). Even though philosophy of ecology is a relatively new field of research, there are a great number of topics that are worth discussing. It is impossible to cover all these topics and to cover them extensively. So, this entry will provide a brief overview of a selection of topics. It is important to note that, as this is an entry on philosophy of ecology, the topics selected for discussion are those that have established philosophical debates, in addition to their importance for ecological research. Also, the length of each section should not be taken as an indication of its importance relative to other topics. Some topics that are already discussed in other entries in this encyclopedia (e.g., conservation biology, biodiversity, levels of organization in biology, models in science) are given briefer overviews.

Finally, categorizing all these diverse topics is itself a difficult task, as there are numerous possible ways to divide them and multiple connections between each topic. In order to maximize the readability and usefulness of the entry for understanding the philosophy of ecology, the entry has been organized as follows. Section 2, titled Philosophical Topics in Ecology, covers the topics originating in ecological research that have also generated philosophical interest. These are the novel topics for philosophy, which only came about because of the study of ecological systems. Section 3, titled Philosophy of Science in Ecology, covers classical issues in general philosophy of science, which are particularly interesting when applied to ecology, either because the classical accounts do not apply to ecological systems or because the investigation of the topic in the context of ecological systems, has generated novel insights.

2. Philosophical Topics in Ecology

2.1 Units of Ecological Research

Most discussions of ecology, including ecological textbooks, divide ecological research in terms of the main “ecological unit” the research focuses on (Jax 2006). The three main units are populations, communities, and ecosystems. On the one hand, research on all of these units is well established, as each is associated with a recognized ecological sub-discipline, with its own research questions, methods and norms. On the other hand, however, there are residual theoretical issues concerning how to define each unit, and whether or not all these units are truly distinct (Odenbaugh 2007; Trombley & Cottenie 2019). The next three sub-sections address the main conceptual and methodological issues associated with ecosystems, communities and populations respectively, and the section concludes with a discussion of individuals, a topic which is gaining momentum in philosophy of ecology. It is important to keep in mind that not all ecological research falls neatly into one of these categories, but straddles more than one unit (e.g., landscape ecology [Turner & Gardner 2015], work on metapopulations [Hanski & Simberloff 1997; Millstein 2010] and community genetics [Antonovics 1992], see also the entry on §3.4).

2.1.1 Ecosystem

Concept

An ecosystem can be minimally defined as all the organisms in an area along with the physical environment with which they interact. The question, and point of contention, is how the parts of an ecosystem are defined and how they are connected to each other. There are three main ways to conceptualize ecosystems (Odenbaugh 2007; Raffaelli & Frid 2010). The first is the Elton-Lindeman view, where ecosystems are complex systems, i.e., more than the sum of their parts. Here, populations of organisms and abiotic factors are conceived as parts of networks with energy flowing between them (as one is consumed by another). The second is the holistic/system’s level conception, advocated by H.T. Odum, where organisms are completely dispensed with and the ecosystem is just the energy flows between trophic levels (Odum 1968). The third is a skeptical approach to ecosystems, either in the sense that they are too loosely connected to be anything more than the sum of their parts (see also §2.1.2), or because various ecosystems are too diverse to have anything in common, so there is nothing to be gained from studying them as a special type of entity (see discussion in Odenbaugh 2007). The ontological status of an ecosystem has some important implications, such as whether or not an ecosystem can be “healthy” (see §2.4.1) and what constitutes ecosystem “function” (see §3.6).

Method

Ecosystem ecology emerged as an alternative to community and population ecology (see §2.1.2 and §2.1.3), because these approaches only took into account the interactions between the living components of the system (Odenbaugh 2007). Ecosystem ecologists stressed the importance of including abiotic factors into ecological research and models (Odum 1968; Raffaelli & Frid 2010). In order to include all these additional causal factors, ecosystem models focus on the transfer of energy between the various trophic levels (e.g., primary producers, herbivores, carnivores, detritivores) (Raffaelli & Frid 2010). Ecosystem-level models, such as Ecosystem Network Models tend to be very rich in detail and constructed for, or at least tailored to a particular system (see also §3.5.1). The main critiques of these models are that

  1. they are system-specific and therefore do not allow the transfer of knowledge to other systems, and
  2. as they incorporate lots of detailed data, they are prone to “overfitting” i.e., including noisy data or errors (Hitchcock & Sober 2004).

2.1.2 Community

Concept

The debate concerning the ontological status of communities has deeper roots than the one about ecosystems. It sits at the heart of a broader debate about the whole sub-discipline of community ecology, namely whether it is a worthwhile approach to studying ecological systems (Lawton 1999; Roughgarden 2009; Simberloff 2004). Communities can be conceived as:

  1. mere aggregates, if their parts are not interdependent and thus do not merit any special ontological status,
  2. wholes, i.e., more than just the sum of their parts, if causal relations exist between their parts, or
  3. individuals, if their parts are so closely connected that they display a level of internal structure (Odenbaugh 2007).

Each of these views has had influential ecologists as advocates (Eliot 2011; Odenbaugh 2007; Roughgarden 2009). For example, Henry Gleason did not believe that communities were anything more than the sum of their parts. George Evelyn Hutchinson believed that communities displayed interactions that included feedback loops, which resulted in self-regulation, and hence should be thought of as wholes. Finally, Frederic Clements viewed communities as being so deeply interconnected that they should be understood as superorganisms, ontologically equivalent to individual organisms. Historians and philosophers of science have also engaged with the concept of an ecological community, providing in-depth discussions of the ontological status and viability of various community concepts along with their historical and sociological evolution (Colyvan, Linquist, et al. 2009; Eliot 2011; Lean 2018; Linquist 2015; Sterelny 2006). While there is no consensus, the prevailing view is that while communities are not superorganisms/individuals, they possess enough internal structure, or clear boundaries to count as wholes (Lean 2018; Sterelny 2006, see also discussion in Odenbaugh 2007. Millstein [2018] supports the communities as individuals view).

Method

Research in community ecology focuses on the interactions between populations within a community. The most important of these are competition, predation, mutualism and parasitism. Community ecology is also the framework for many of the landmark concepts and ideas in ecological research, including the majority of concepts that are thought of as typically ecological, such as the niche, trophic levels, keystone species and ecological engineering (Ricklefs & Miller 2000). Of all the approaches in ecology, community ecology is probably the one with the greatest focus on experimentation (Lubchenco & Read 1991). In fact, many ideas in community ecology were established through landmark experiments, such as Paine’s intertidal experiments that led to the concept of a keystone species, while others, such as Gause’s competition experiments, became renowned for demonstrating that theoretical principles could manifest in real-world communities. Models also play an important role in community ecology, the most notable of which are the Lotka-Volterra models of competition and predation (Knuuttila & Loettgers 2017; Weisberg 2007b). The advantages and disadvantages of these models are similar to the ones used in population ecology, discussed next (see also §3.5).

2.1.3 Population

Concept

Ecologists typically define a population as a group of interbreeding organisms or organisms of the same species, found in the same space or area at the same time (Rockwood 2015). The position that populations are real units in nature is less controversial than the equivalent claims for communities and ecosystems (Cooper & Hurd 2019; Millstein 2009; but see Gannett 2003). Still, philosophers disagree on a number of points regarding the nature of populations. An important contribution to this literature is a series of papers by Roberta Millstein (2009, 2013, 2014), where she argues that the ambiguity in the way the term population is used by ecologists and evolutionary biologists is problematic, as it leads to confusion and can hamper progress in biological research. Instead, she proposes the causal interactionist population concept (CIPC), for both ecological and evolutionary populations. Here, a population is defined as:

at least two conspecific organisms that, over the course of a generation, are actually engaged in survival or reproductive interactions, or both. (Millstein 2014: 750)

An important dimension of Millstein’s conception is that populations are viewed as individuals, after Ghiselin and Hull’s conception of species as individuals (§2.1.2, see also species, §2.2). Critiques of the CIPC include arguments against populations-as-individuals, on the basis that the ecological conception of population differs significantly from its evolutionary counterpart and that the populations-as-individuals account applies only to the latter (Cooper & Hurd 2019), along with arguments for a more pluralistic account of populations (Stegenga 2010).

Method

Population ecology is as old as ecology itself. Indeed, on one view, ecology only became a true scientific discipline, when mathematical models from demography and physics were applied to ecological populations (Evans et al. 2013; Kingsland 1985 [1995]; see also §3.1). Research in population ecology focuses on population dynamics, especially demographic processes (such as density dependent growth, Allee effects) and the effects of migration (Rockwood 2015). Models in population ecology tend to be simple and general, in the sense that they contain few parameters and apply to many different populations. The main critique of these models is that they are not very realistic, as they leave out factors that are idiosyncratic to some populations (Evans et al. 2013; see also §3.5.1). For example, competition models that are developed for animals do not apply that well to plant populations, as they do not take into account the importance of abiotic factors for plant competition (Berger et al. 2008).

2.1.4 Individual (Organism)

When compared to the other ecological levels, the level of individual (organisms) has received less attention. Most models and experiments focus on groups rather than individuals, and when individuals do make an appearance (e.g., in individual-based models), they are usually aggregates or averages of the entire population and largely homogeneous with each other (Kaiser & Trappes 2021; Trappes 2022). There are good epistemic reasons for this. Variation between individuals is often an indication of error in data collection or interpretation and can add unnecessary complexity to the model or experiment. Homogenizing across individuals can thus reduce observation and measurement errors and can allows scientists to distinguish between genuine causal factors and mere noise (Elliott-Graves 2019, 2023).

Nonetheless, there is a contingent of ecologists who advocate for greater focus on individuals, especially on individual differences. Some sub-disciplines, such as Behavioral Ecology and Physiological Ecology, focus explicitly on individuals. Moreover, in 1972, Joan Roughgarden argued that differences between individuals within a population explain the phenomenon of “niche width” i.e., the variety of resources a population exploits, which in turn has implications for the resilience of the population (Roughgarden 1972). Individual-Based models, imported from economics (see §3.6), highlighted the importance of focusing on individuals, even though the individuals themselves are largely homogeneous and differ only on one or two dimensions (Justus 2014). More recently, there has been a concerted effort to incorporate individual differences in models and experiments in numerous pars of ecological research (Moran et al. 2017; Mutwill et al. 2021; Nagel et al. 2021; Schwarz et al. 2021). This has led to important insights. For example, dominant meerkat females temporarily evict subordinate females from the group, leading to a higher level of spontaneous miscarriages and a suppression of their competitors’ reproduction (Trappes et al. 2022; Andrew Young, et al., 2006).

Note: The discussion of individuals in the context of philosophy of ecology is not related to the debate surrounding biological individuality (see biological individuals). The latter concept centers on individuals in a predominantly evolutionary context. For a comparison between the two debates see (Kaiser & Trappes 2021).

2.2 The Niche

Perhaps the most important distinctly ecological concept is that of the “niche”. As is the case with many other ecological concepts, the niche is notoriously difficult to define. A number of influential ecologists have formulated conceptualizations of the niche, including Grinnell, Elton, Hutchinson and MacArthur. Categorizing these concepts is far from straightforward, as they overlap in some ways but differ in others. Section 2.2.1, outlines three historically important conceptualizations of the niche (the niche as habitat, the functional niche and the niche as an n-dimensional hyperspace). Section 2.2.2, examines the role of the niche in ecological theorizing along with some critiques of the niche concepts and framework.

2.2.1 Conceptualizing the Niche

Habitat

Historically, the idea of the niche can be dated back to Darwin, yet the first lengthy treatment of the niche concept is found in the work of Joseph Grinnell, who used the term to describe the aspects of the environment, biotic and abiotic, that a species occupied (Gaffney 1975; Pocheville 2015). There are two central characteristics of the Grinnellian niche. The first is that each niche can only be occupied by one species, that is, two species in the same ecosystem cannot occupy the exact same niche. Second, new niches can arise as habitats change, and existing niches can become vacant, as species become locally extinct, providing the space and adaptive pressure for other species to occupy them. This gives the Grinnellian niche explanatory power, as properties of niches can explain certain species’ phenotypic adaptations: organisms adapt to fill vacant niches (see discussion in Justus 2021).

Function

A different conception of the niche was proposed by Charles Elton. Elton noticed that while there is a lot of variation in terms of the species that populate different habitats, there are some important similarities in terms of trophic level: most communities have herbivores, carnivores and detritivores. His conception of the niche focuses on the function of the organism within a community, i.e., its place in the biotic environment and its relationships with other organisms, such as its prey and predators. Elton thought of the niche as analogous to an occupation, famously stating:

When an ecologist says “there goes a badger” he should include in his thoughts some definite idea of the animal’s place in the community to which it belongs, just as if he had said “there goes the vicar”. (Elton 1927: 64)

Elton’s functional conception of the niche also accommodates the idea of vacant niches, which can be occupied by organisms that adapt, migrate or invade a community.

N-dimensional hyperspace

About 20 years after Elton, G.E. Hutchinson proposed yet another conception of a niche that bore some similarities but also some important differences to both previous conceptions. The basic idea is this: for any particular species, imagine a space, where every environmental factor that affects it (biotic and abiotic) is represented on an axis. The number of relevant factors (n) determine how many axes the space will have. The space within these axes, where a species can persist (i.e., has positive fitness) is its fundamental niche. Within this space is a smaller one which delineates where the species actually exists—this is its realized niche (Chase & Leibold 2003).

2.2.2 Against the Niche

An important feature of the niche concept is that it helps to explain the dynamics and structure of ecological communities. It does so through the principle of competitive exclusion (CEP), which states that complete competitors, i.e., species with identical niches, cannot coexist (Bausman 2019; Griesemer 1992). So, the closer the competition is between species the higher the incentive to diversify one’s niche or migrate. For some, competition theory, inclusive of the CEP, is the cornerstone of ecology and its relationship with evolutionary biology, as it is the basis for understanding community dynamics and the evolutionary structure of communities (Griesemer 1992; Kingsland 1985 [1995]).

The popularity of the niche concept is extensive but not ubiquitous. Some ecologists believe that the niche/competition framework is insufficient for explaining community-level ecological phenomena. For example, the CEP has been criticized as untestable and not scientifically useful (see discussion in Justus 2019). An important landmark in this debate is Stephen Hubbell’s neutral theory of community structure, where differences between species, are neutral, i.e., irrelevant to their success within a community (Hubbell 2001). Instead, community structure is affected by drift (random birth and death), dispersal, and speciation. In other words, niches do not influence the relative abundances of each species in a community, so they have little import in the study of community structure. The neutral theory itself is quite controversial, as is its exact relationship with the niche/competition framework (Bausman 2019; Chase & Leibold 2003; Justus 2021). The neutral theory can be seen as an alternative to the competition framework, or as a null hypothesis, i.e., a hypothesis that must be shown to be false before an alternative (here, a competition hypothesis) is accepted (Bausman 2019). Some ecologists have attempted to reconcile the two alternatives into one theory that integrates aspects of both approaches, (see for example Chesson 2000; Vellend 2010).

A different criticism comes from Justus (2019; 2021), who argues that the niche concept is superfluous, on the grounds that none of the existing niche concepts are actually useful in ecological research, as they do not consistently explain or predict community structure in the real world. Moreover, attempts to combine existing niche concepts in order to overcome the deficiencies of individual definitions are doomed to fail, because such combinations become too abstract and devoid of causal information to adequately represent real ecological communities, let alone predict community structure.

2.3 Biological Invasions

The recognition that species outside their native range can cause problems for indigenous species dates back to Darwin, who realized that in each habitat species have friends and enemies which affect their population’s growth, and when a was introduced to a new habitat without enemies, it could take over at the expense of the native species (Reichard & White 2003). After Darwin, there was little interest in the problems associated with invasive species, until the publication of Charles Elton’s book The Ecology of Invasions by Animals and Plants in 1958. Elton thought that invasive species were exceedingly problematic and his main aim was to provide a framework for the conservation of native communities (Davis 2006). Since then, there has been a rapid increase in the research on biological invasions, which has resulted in the establishment of invasion biology as a sub-discipline of ecology, with research programs and journals dedicated to research on the concepts, methods, impacts and management of biological invaders (Enders et al. 2020; Reichard & White, 2003).

2.3.1 Defining biological Invaders

Defining a biological invader is not an easy task. Terms to describe species outside their native range include “invasive”, “alien”, “exotic”, “introduced”, “non-native”, “adventive”, “neophyte”, “naturalized”, “immigrant”, “weed”, “noxious”, along with compound terms such as “invasive alien”, “non-native invader” and so on (Colautti & Richardson 2009; Pysek 1995; Ashley Young & Larson 2011). Each of these terms has its own set of assumptions and implications that preclude a universally acceptable classification. For example, if we were to define “invasive” as a species that was widespread outside its native range, this classification includes many species typically classified as invasive. However, a significant number of cases would be much less obvious. First, what counts as a species’ native range? Migration (including human-assisted migration) of plants and animals has occurred for millennia, but not all migrations have resulted in invasion. For many widespread species, we might not even be sure about their native range (Courchamp, Hulme, & Pyšek 2020). Second, what counts as widespread? Some species become established and spread yet do not pose threats to native ecosystems. Should these count as invaders or not? Third, some species become “integrated” into new ecosystems and removing them can actually create problems for native species (Singer & Parmesan 2018). Should these species count as invasive?

The debate surrounding the definition of biological invaders has gained momentum, resulting in heated exchanges between prominent invasion biologists (and some philosophers) (Frank et al. 2019; Guiaşu & Tindale 2023; Ricciardi & Ryan 2018; Richardson & Ricciardi 2013; Sagoff 2018; Young & Larson 2011). The debate centers on the effect of value-laden terminology on perceptions of non-native species and their management. On one side of the debate are those who believe that the terminology used to described non-native species (such as alien or invasive) is xenophobic and leads to biases in the research, resource allocation and management of biological invasions (Davis, Chew, et al. 2011; Guiaşu & Tindale 2023; Sagoff 2018). They argue that the perceived threat of invasives is often overblown, for example because few extinctions can be attributed to the effect of biological invasions (Gurevitch & Padilla 2004), while in some cases their effect can even be positive, as they can mitigate other anthropogenic disturbances, such as soil erosion, while their presence can increase biodiversity or introduce novel (and sometimes stabilizing) interactions in biological communities (Davis, Chew, et al. 2011). In addition, efforts to manage biological invasions are often unnecessary, as they are unlikely to succeed despite incurring significant economics costs, and in some cases can even cause additional harm to native communities, exacerbating existing problems or even creating new ones (Davis, Chew, et al. 2011; Guiaşu & Tindale 2023; Thiengo et al. 2007).

The opposing view is that, occasional benefits notwithstanding, the overall effect of invasive species is overwhelmingly negative (Richardson & Ricciardi 2013). Proponents of this view cite numerous cases, especially island communities, where invaders have decimated indigenous species, and disrupted ecosystem functioning (Simberloff 2011). Even in cases where the effects of invaders are not yet obvious, either because they are not yet widely spread in a new area, or because they do not compete with certain native species, there is always the possibility that a non-native species will pose a threat to a native ecosystem in the future, a possibility that is becoming increasingly more likely due to the effects of climate change (Sax & Brown 2000; Simberloff 2014). The rhetoric on this side of the debate is also quite strong, as scientists in this camp charge their opponents with espousing “invasive species denialism”, i.e., adopting a non-scientific or pseudoscientific approach to biological invasions, by focusing on the value-leadenness of terminology, cherry picking examples of positive effects of invaders and ignoring or downplaying the evidence of negative effects of invasions (Frank et al. 2019; Ricciardi & Ryan 2018).

2.3.2 The Causes of Biological Invasions

Another important question in invasion biology is: what causes some invasions to succeed and others to fail? The search for the causes of biological invasions has its own history and tensions. There are two main research traditions on the cause of invasions. In the first tradition, which grew out of population ecology, the causes of invasion were to be found at the level of the invader. The idea is that invasions succeed when invaders possess a combination of traits which allow them to establish and spread in new areas, by outcompeting or otherwise disturbing native species. For example, (Grotkopp et al. 2002) identified small seed mass, short generation times and a high relative growth rate as the characteristics of successful invasions in the genus Pinus. Species which have a fast growth strategy have increased productivity which results in larger overall biomass. Together with a greater efficiency in dispersal, this confers a competitive advantage to species in a new area, at the expense of the native species. That is, faster growth, in terms of individual and population level biomass, can decrease the available resources for other plants in the same habitat.

The second tradition identifies the causes of invasion at the level of the community or ecosystem, i.e., by focusing on characteristics that allow communities to resist invasion. The idea is that each community erects a series of barriers which invaders have to overcome in order to succeed in invading. A popular example of an ecosystem-level barrier to invasion was biodiversity, the idea being that a more diverse community would be more robust to perturbation (Kennedy et al. 2002). While this descendant of the diversity-stability hypothesis has largely been abandoned (McCann 2000), it has been replaced by more nuanced accounts. For example, (Davis, Grime, & Thompson 2000) argue that diverse communities, which occupy more of an environment’s niches are less likely to have fluctuating resources as they use them up more consistently, thus decreasing the availability of resources to invaders.

Neither research tradition has succeeded in producing a generalized theory of invasion that can be used for prediction and management (Catford et al. 2009; Hayes & Barry 2007; Reichard & White 2003). Despite attempts to integrate the two research traditions, a unified theory of invasion biology has yet to be developed. This is an ongoing thorn in the side of some invasion biologists, as they worry that invasion biology cannot progress without such a theory (Blackburn et al. 2011; Enders et al. 2020). However, some ecologists and philosophers view a unified theory of invasion biology as unlikely, as biological invasions are exceedingly complex and context dependent (Jeschke et al. 2012; Valéry et al. 2013). The particular causal factors and dynamic interactions that give rise to each invasion are idiosyncratic, possibly even unique, so even if we find a general theory, it will have so many exceptions that it will not be very useful for predicting and managing invasions (Elliott-Graves 2016) (see also §3.3).

2.4 Conservation

Conservation biology focuses on protecting parts of the world that are deemed ecologically important. It can be considered a sub-discipline of ecology, or a distinct field of research, with aims that sometimes diverge from traditional or “fundamental” ecology (Justus & Wakil 2021; Linquist 2008, see also §3.7). The next two sections examine two important issues in conservation biology, the ideas of nature and wilderness and their relationship to restoration and the notion of biodiversity. Other important topics in conservation biology include the extent to which it is ethically-driven, which is outlined in section 3.7, along with debates concerning the best approaches and methods for determining and implementing conservation strategies. The latter issue is covered extensively in (conservation biology) and will not be discussed in this entry.

2.4.1 Nature, Wilderness and Restoration

One set of issues in the philosophy of conservation biology concerns the “ideal” of conservation, i.e., how we should conceptualize the goals of conservation. There are ongoing debates about how we should understand the concepts of “nature” and “wilderness”, for example, whether humans and human activity are part of nature, and when a habitat can be considered “wild” (Higgs 2003; Woods 2017). These disagreements are not merely semantic, as they can affect actual strategies for conservation. An important and ongoing discussion concerns the historical fidelity of restoration projects. One view, put forward by the Society for Ecological Restoration (SER), amongst others, is that restoration should not just aim to “mend” damaged ecosystems but that it should aim to restore ecosystem functions by returning ecosystems to some past state, i.e., so that this function is performed by the same entities, that did so in the past (SER in Desjardins 2015; Garson 2014). An alternative view is that historical fidelity is difficult to identify and measure (which is the relevant past of an ecosystem? How far into the past should we go? How can we be sure about the species compositions in past versions of ecosystems? Etc.), and should therefore be replaced with other, more fundamental goals (Sarkar 2011, 2014a, 2014b). Those responding to this critique of historical fidelity concede that there are conceptual and practical difficulties with historical fidelity, yet argue that it is still valuable as a goal for conservation (Desjardins 2015; Garson 2014).

A related debate concerns the notion of “ecosystem health”. We could think of the aim (or at least one aim) of conservation biology as the promotion and maintenance of healthy ecosystems. However, there is little agreement about what whether ecosystems can be the bearers of health (McShane 2004). The three main views in the debate are:

  1. that ecosystems can literally be healthy and unhealthy (McShane 2004),
  2. that ecosystem health is a metaphorical concept, akin to that of a “healthy economy” (Callicott 1995)
  3. that ecosystems are not the types of entities that can be healthy or unhealthy, e.g., because they are not organisms, because they are merely social constructs, or because the appropriate notion of ecosystem function does not provide norms of performance that are necessary for a notion of health (see discussion in Odenbaugh 2010, McShane 2004 and §3.6).

2.4.2 Biodiversity

What should conservation biology conserve? The usual answer to this question is “biodiversity” (Justus 2021; Maclaurin & Sterelny 2008; Santana 2014; Sarkar 2002; Sarkar & Margules 2002, see also biodiversity and conservation biology). There is general agreement that biodiversity is extremely important, yet much less agreement on what exactly biodiversity means (Santana 2014; Maclaurin & Sterelny 2008). On a superficial level, biodiversity simply means the “variability among living organisms” in various ecosystems (United Nations summit definition, found in Santana 2014, p. 763. However, this superficial definition is not particularly helpful, because it is akin to saying that biodiversity includes “everything in biology” (Sarkar 2002). Such a concept is neither easily operationalizable, nor does it help us determine what should be conserved (Santana 2014; Sarkar 2002).

There are two general approaches to defining biodiversity. The first is to define it explicitly, i.e., to identify a set of characteristics that jointly pick out the concept. The most common explicit definition of biodiversity is in terms of species richness, often augmented with another characteristic (Maclaurin & Sterelny 2008). Put simply, species richness is just the number of species in a certain area. Measures of species richness usually include another dimension, such as abundance (the number of individuals in a population), evenness (the commonness or rarity of a species), phenotypic disparity (how varied traits are in a group of species) or evolutionary disparity (how far away species are in their evolutionary trajectories) (Santana 2014).

The second approach is to define biodiversity implicitly, by specifying a set of rules or axioms, “place-prioritization” algorithms, from which the concept can be determined (Sarkar 2002). The basic idea is to identify which parts of the world to preserve, when we only have a limited budget. We start with a list of biodiversity surrogates (such as species, traits, environmental parameters, along with various compositions of species, subsets of species, and environmental parameters). We then carve up an area into “cells” (of varying sizes) and identify which surrogates appear in each cell. The algorithms can be used to determine the smallest number of cells that need to be protected, so that all surrogates are represented or, given a number of cells that can be protected the algorithms can determine which cells should be protected so as to maximize the number of surrogates that are represented. So, biodiversity is defined as what the algorithms determine should be prioritized.

Another view is to dispense with the concept entirely. Santana (2014, 2017) has argued that none of the existing definitions of biodiversity are viable. Against species richness, he argues that it does not capture all aspects of biological value. He points out that not all areas or species are of equal value. For example, old growth forests or rare biomes might be worth preserving even if they have lower biodiversity than others. In contrast, some species such as certain viruses are much less valuable and ought to be eliminated. He also argues that many conceptions of biodiversity include other concepts, such as stability which are controversial; he worries that these connections can undermine conservation efforts. All in all, he argues that the concept of biodiversity does more harm than good and should therefore be eliminated. Only then will we able to focus on what really matters, i.e., biological value.

For a more detailed overview of all the positions in section 2.2, see (conservation biology, biodiversity) and (Justus 2021: ch. 5). For more details on specific views, see: for multidimensional approach/pluralism, Maclaurin & Sterelny (2008), for implicit definitions of biodiversity, Sarkar (2002, 2005) and discussion in Justus 2021, for biodiversity eliminativism, Santana (2014, 2017) and responses to eliminativism, see (Burch-Brown & Archer 2017; Justus 2021).

3. Philosophy of Science in Ecology

3.1 The Scientific Status of Ecology

Ecologists display a striking degree of introspection regarding the quality of ecological research and the overall scientific status of their discipline. This is perhaps due to the historical development of Ecology, where the introduction of mathematical models from physics was viewed by many as an important step in the establishment of a truly scientific discipline (Kingsland 1985 [1995]). Throughout its history, ecologists have been at pains to distinguish their discipline from natural history, which they viewed as a merely descriptive endeavor, devoid of general theories and predictive power (Johnson 2007; Kingsland 1985 [1995]). These worries continue in the present. There are a number of publications which lament the state of research in ecology or its sub-disciplines because of alleged theoretical and empirical failures, lack of progress, lack of unification across methods or sub-disciplines, etc. (Courchamp, Dunne, et al. 2015; Houlahan et al. 2017; Lawton 1996; Marquet et al. 2014; Peters 1991; Scheiner & Willig 2011; Shrader-Frechette & McCoy 1993; Valéry et al. 2013).

On the one hand, a certain level of introspection and concern about the quality of research is an indicator of good practice, as it helps to maintain standards and improve methods in a discipline. On the other hand, however, too much concern can be counterproductive, as it can undermine the efforts of practicing scientists. Indeed, the importance placed on unificatory theories, predictive power and mathematical models is sometimes described as “physics envy” (Egler 1986; Kingsland 1985 [1995: 234]; McIntosh 1987; Shrader-Frechette & McCoy 1993: 34). Moreover, these theoretical concerns can be disproportionately damaging to some sub-disciplines, where generalization and prediction are particularly difficult (see §3.2). For example, there have been calls to eliminate invasion biology as an autonomous sub-discipline (Valéry et al. 2013), along with calls to decrease the funding allocated to applied ecological research in favor of fundamental (or pure) ecological research (see §3.6 for a discussion of the distinction) (Courchamp, Dunne et al. 2015).

3.2 Complexity

Complexity in ecology is a thorny topic, as there is no uncontested definition of complexity, neither within, nor outside ecology (Elliott-Graves, 2023). When ecologists talk about complexity, they are usually referring to one or more characteristics of ecological systems, that contribute to complexity. These characteristics include having multiple parts (Levins 1966; Miller & Page 2007), interaction between parts (in terms of the number of interactions (connectance) and the strength of these interactions (interaction strength) (Odenbaugh 2011; Pimm 1991), non-linearity or feedback (a change in one factor can result in a disproportional change in the behavior of the system) and path dependence (a system's later states depend on their previous states) (Levin 1998).

3.2.1 Characteristics of Ecological Complexity

A particularly important characteristic of complexity, both within and outside ecology, is that their behavior amounts to more than the sum of their parts (Mitchell 2003; Simon 1962). In other words, they have emergent properties. Some emergent properties are considered to be features of complexity in their own right. For example, hierarchical organization of a system contributes to self-organization and causal autonomy i.e., the ability of the system to regulate its own states and creating and maintaining the processes that enable it to function (Levin 2002, 2005). Emergence is important in broader terms, as it forms the basis for an anti-reductionist approach to complex systems research (Mitchell 2009). The idea is that because these properties are more than the sum of their parts, investigating complex systems should occur at the levels that these behaviors occur, rather than at lower levels.

A characteristic of complexity which is particularly relevant to ecological systems is heterogeneity (Elliott-Graves 2018; Levins 1966; Matthewson 2011). Put simply, systems are heterogeneous when their parts are not homogeneous, but vary in one or more ways. Consider a suit of chainmail armor: it is made up of many interacting metal rings, yet the rings are homogeneous, as each ring is almost identical to the rest. In contrast, ecological systems display intra-system heterogeneity: each system is made up of many different species and abiotic components. In fact, there are even differences between individuals of the same species, in terms of how they behave (Elliott-Graves 2018, 2023; Levins 1966). Ecological systems also display inter-system heterogeneity, i.e., there are differences between systems (Elliott-Graves 2018, 2023; Matthewson 2011). For example, a forest and a grassland ecosystem may have similar trophic levels, but they are made up of very different types of species. Even two ecosystems of the same “type” e.g., two forests, often have very different species and/or display very different dynamics and interactions.

3.2.2 The Effects of Complexity

Complexity is important in two very different ways for ecology. The first is positive, in the sense that it explains some of ecology’s fundamental questions: how are ecosystems possible? How can they persist in the face of countless internal and external disturbances? The idea is that complex communities (i.e., communities that have diverse/heterogeneous interacting parts) are more stable, that is able to adapt to changes such as fires, new competitors, new predators or sudden climatic changes, without falling apart. This view was famously disputed by Robert May (1973), who used mathematical models to show that we should expect complex communities to be less stable. The debate continues to this day, with ecologists and philosophers of ecology using increasingly refined notions of complexity, diversity and stability to argue for or against the “diversity-stability” hypothesis (McCann 2000; Odenbaugh 2011). Despite their differences regarding this hypothesis, however, ecologists seem to have reached a certain consensus, agreeing that complexity is a feature of healthy and mature ecological systems, even though such systems may be susceptible to particular disturbances (Hooper et al. 2005; Loreau et al. 2001; McCann 2000; Parrott 2010).

Complexity is also important in a negative sense, as it hinders the study of ecological systems, creating difficulties for the collection of data, the setup and interpretation of experiments, the construction and interpretation of models, the predictability of system dynamics and consequently the feasibility and success of interventions. The complexity of ecological systems, especially in the form of dynamic interactions, non-linearity, feedback and heterogeneity, make each ecological phenomenon or system idiosyncratic, which hinders the construction of generalizations and predictions. In other words, the knowledge scientists acquire from studying one ecological system does not transfer to other systems or to the same system in the future (Elliott-Graves 2023; Levins 1966; Matthewson 2011). For example, explanations of community structures that were based on the keystone species concept have subsequently been proven to be false, as it turns out that keystone species do not behave in the same way across different systems (Cottee-Jones & Whittaker 2012). Similarly, predictions can fail when underlying patterns change or break. For example, species distribution models (SDMs) are often used to predict the range of a species colonizing a new area, by projecting variables of the species’ native niche to the new area (Sobek-Swant et al. 2012). However, climate change can render these predictions inaccurate, e.g., unexpected higher temperatures or fewer extreme cold events can increase a species’ range to regions that it would normally not be able to colonize (Cuddington et al. 2018).

3.3 Laws

A related issue is that of laws. In traditional accounts of philosophy of science, uncovering laws of nature is an important goal of scientific research and a hallmark of a mature, successful scientific discipline (Colyvan & Ginzburg 2003; Mitchell 2000). There are numerous and differing accounts of how to define laws of nature (see laws of nature). A simple reconstruction of the traditional view of laws is the following: laws of nature are generalizations that are necessarily true (i.e., not accidental), and hold in all space and time without any exceptions (Mitchell 2000). Candidates for lawhood in ecology have included the principle of competitive exclusion, density-dependent population regulation, equilibrium theory of island biogeography, optimality models, supply-side ecology and metapopulation theory and allometric scaling laws (Beck 1997; Justus 2021; Raerinne 2011).

The problem is that in the biological sphere, most generalizations “fail” on all three counts. For a start, biological entities and their interactions are contingent on evolutionary history, i.e., they are historical accidents, so any generalizations about them or their causal relations cannot be necessary truths (Mitchell 2003). Second, the complexity of biological systems means that generalizations are far from exceptionless, but only hold in certain contexts (see §3.2). Third, generalizations tend to apply to subsets of organisms, so they are far from universal. All of the candidates for lawhood mentioned in the previous paragraph have been overturned, due to the emergence of empirical counterexamples (Beck 1997; Raerinne 2011).

There are roughly three ways for how to interpret these “failures”, in ecology. The first is that these are indeed failures, and a discipline without laws is not truly scientific (Lawton 1999; Peters 1991). The second view is to concede that ecology does not have laws in the traditional sense, but that this does not diminish the scientific status of the discipline (Beck 1997; Shrader-Frechette & McCoy 1993) (see §3.1.). The third view is to argue that if, on this definition of laws of nature, ecology does not have laws, then the fault lies with the definition of laws, as it is unnecessarily strong (Colyvan & Ginzburg 2003; Linquist et al. 2016). The classic dichotomies (necessary/accidental, universal/contingent) are not useful for practicing scientists, as the point of generalizations is that they help scientists achieve various goals, such as explaining and predicting natural phenomena or intervening on the world. In this context, the most important characteristic of ecological laws is that they are invariant, stable or resilient, i.e., they persist for long enough, in certain contexts to be detected and to be used to make predictions (though what exactly long enough etc. means is also a matter of debate) (Colyvan & Ginzburg 2003; Linquist et al. 2016. For a more detailed discussion of laws in ecology see Elliott-Graves 2023). Finally, Raerinne (Raerinne 2011, 2013, 2015) merges aspects of all three views, arguing that the aspect of laws that we should care about is the fact that they are generalizations that are invariant and extrapolatable. If ecological generalizations are invariant, then they are sufficient for generating explanations, so whether or not they are laws is beside the question.

3.4 Levels

Debates and discussions about levels in philosophy of science are quite complicated, as they bring together ontological, epistemic and methodological issues from philosophy and many different sciences (Brooks et al. 2021). The issues concerning levels in ecology can be situated within the more general discussion of organizational levels in biology (levels of organization in biology). The main view that is relevant for ecology is the traditional “layer-cake” account.[1] Historically, this view held sway in philosophy of science for many years and is still prevalent in many sciences (including ecology) (levels of organization in biology). Roughly, it states that the world is organized hierarchically, and each level of nature corresponds to a science that studies it. Things become complicated when we are trying to determine what counts as a level, whether all levels are equal or whether some are more fundamental or should be prioritized in science. Thus, for example, reductionists tend to prioritize the smaller levels, while anti-reductionists tend to look at the higher levels for explaining and predicting scientific phenomena. Due to space considerations, this is a very loose characterization of all these views; for more detailed explanations see (reductionism in biology, scientific reduction, levels of organization in biology, units and levels of selection, mechanisms in science, emergent properties, supervenience).

The traditional layer-cake approach together with its disagreements about the relative importance of each level is plainly apparent in ecology (though ecologists tend to use the term scale rather than level), starting from the fact that different ecological units (individuals, populations, communities and ecosystems) are distinct sub-disciplines with their own methodologies (see §2.1 & §3.5). Indeed, the influential conservation biologist Reed Noss claimed that

many of the most persistent controversies in ecology can be traced to different parties viewing a situation at different spatial or temporal scales … The scale at which Nature is viewed determines the patterns and processes detected. (Noss 1992: 240).

Ontological considerations of scale have a long history in ecology. For example, Odum’s seminal textbook for ecology (Odum 1953), adds populations and communities to the hierarchy of organizational levels in biology (cell, tissue, organ, organism). Two decades later, O’Neill et al., extended the ontological hierarchy to ecosystems (O’Neill et al. 1986). As shown in section 2.1, there are also ongoing debates in philosophy of ecology about the ontological status of various ecological units, e.g., populations, communities and ecosystems, including whether each of these units is a mere aggregate, a whole or an individual, and whether or not they reflect a real natural category (Lean 2018; Millstein 2009; Odenbaugh 2007, 2010; Stegenga 2010). Ecological discussions of scale have also focused on the importance of time as a scale, i.e., how long it takes for a phenomenon or process to take place. Ecologists developed a hierarchy where time-scales constrain other organizational scales, e.g., photosynthesis versus tree growth (O’Neill et al. 1986). According to James DiFrisco (2017), this prioritization of time scale over other organizational scales is an important conceptual innovation, which allows the whole organizational concept of scale to overcome many of the criticisms leveled against it (e.g., by Angela Potochnik, 2021).

Ecologists are also concerned with the epistemic effects of scale in ecology. Ecological phenomena and processes happen at multiple scales (e.g., populations, ecosystems, seasons, generations) and the scale at which a phenomenon manifests is often not easy to investigate, so measurements must occur at other (usually smaller) scales and results extrapolated to the level of interest (Schneider 2001). A typical example of “the problem of scale”, as it has been named, is biodiversity loss (see §2.4), where measuring biodiversity necessarily happens at small areas, yet the effect of species extinction manifests at the level of ecosystems. As species numbers do not scale directly with increases in geographical area, there is always a discrepancy between the sample measures of biodiversity and their extrapolation to the whole ecosystem (Chase & Knight 2013; Schneider 2001).

3.5 Methods

The main research methods used in ecology are mathematical and computational models, experiments, observational studies along with a variety of statistical tools for data collection, analysis, interpretation and synthesis. Historically, research at various levels and types of ecosystem were predominantly associated with certain methods, e.g., aquatic ecosystems focusing on population or community-level models, island biogeography focusing on field experiments etc. (Resetarits & Bernardo 1998; Hairston 1989; Kingsland 1985 [1995], 2005). However, with greater recognition of the advantages and disadvantages of each method along with technological advances in data collection and computation power, methods are becoming increasingly integrated across ecological scales and sub-disciplines (Kareiva, Parker, & Pascuel 1996; Kareiva & Andersen 1988; Peck 2004).

3.5.1 Models

Mathematical modeling is an integral part of ecological research (Odenbaugh 2019b). In fact, for many ecologists, Ecology only became a truly scientific discipline with the development and extensive use of mathematical models (Kingsland 1985 [1995], 2005). The history of ecology is punctuated with influential models, such as models of population growth (Reed & Pearl 1927), the Lotka-Volterra predation and competition models (Knuuttila & Loettgers 2017; Weisberg 2007b), Species distribution models (such as GARP and MAXENT; Sobek-Swant et al. 2012; Townsend Peterson et al. 2007) and Ecosystem Network Models (such as ECOPATH and ECOSIM; Heymans et al. 2016).

Model Complexity

An important and ongoing debate in the literature on ecological modeling concerns the appropriate level of complexity that should be incorporated into mathematical models. In the first camp are those who argue that models should be simple so as to reduce the inherent complexity of systems, making them more tractable and generalizable (Hitchcock & Sober 2004; Perretti, Munch & Sugihara 2013). The rationale is that reducing complexity allows scientists to distinguish between the core causal factors that give rise to classes of phenomena and mere details that are idiosyncratic to particular systems. In the second camp are those who believe that models should incorporate complexity, so as to provide more accurate pictures of complex systems (Essington et al. 2017; Evans et al. 2013; Travis et al. 2014). The rationale here is that mirroring the complexity of real-world systems ensures that the models will capture all the relevant causal factors and dynamics giving rise to complex phenomena.

A more nuanced conceptual framework for modeling in Ecology comes from the work of Richard Levins (Elliott-Graves 2020a; Levins 1966, 1993; Weisberg 2007a). Levins argues that biological systems are incredibly complex, so much so that it is impractical to capture all the complexity in a single model. Even if it were feasible to construct such a model, its results would make little sense to us. Moreover, models are used for different purposes, such as understanding phenomena, making predictions and intervening on the world. Thus, rather than attempting to determine the optimal level of model complexity, Levins argues that what counts as optimal in each case will depend on the system being studied and the model’s intended use. More specifically, Levins identifies three desiderata for model-building: realism, generality and precision. Realism refers to how accurately a model captures the causal structure of the world; models are realistic when they are not overly simplified or idealized. Models are general when they apply to many systems in the world and precise when their outputs are finely specified (Levins 1966, 1993). Due to the complexity of biological systems, scientists can maximize only two out of the three desiderata. This gives rise to three strategies for model building along with three corresponding types of models. Type I models (such as the Lotka-Volterra population dynamics models) sacrifice realism for precision and generality, Type II models, (such as species distribution models and ecosystem network models) sacrifice generality for realism and precision and Type III models (such as loop analysis and fuzzy interaction webs) sacrifice precision for generality and realism.

Model Pluralism

According to Levins, scientists need not choose between models, but can (and should) be pluralists and use multiple strategies. There are two ways in which model pluralism can be conceptualized. The first concerns the discipline of ecology as a whole: different research questions or different phenomena call for different models. Thus, there will be cases where generality is more important, others in which predictive accuracy is more important and so on. In each of these cases a different type of model might be most useful. The second conceptualization of model pluralism (which Levins also supported) is stronger and concerns each particular scientific investigation. Here, the idea is that scientists should use multiple models (ideally from different strategies) to investigate a particular phenomenon. As long as the models are independent from each other, then they can cancel out, or at least mitigate, each other’s errors and biases. If we are very lucky, the model outputs will converge, yielding inferential robustness, which can increase our confidence in the models (Justus 2012). In Levins’s own words, “truth is at the intersection of independent lies” (1966: 423).

For an argument against Levins’s proposed trade-off framework see (Orzack 2005; Orzack & Sober 1993). For Levins’s response to these criticisms, see (Levins 1993). For discussion and refinement of Levins’s framework see (Elliott-Graves 2020a, 2023; Justus 2005, 2012; Odenbaugh 2003; Weisberg 2007a).

3.5.2 Experiments

As is the case with other disciplines, philosophers of ecology tend to focus more on the theoretical aspects of scientific practice (experiment in biology, see also §3.1), which includes theory building and testing, model construction and how models provide information about the real world (Elliott-Graves 2020b; Odenbaugh 2001; Weisberg 2007b). Nonetheless, experiments have an important place in ecological research, because of the sheer quantity of experimental research and because of the epistemic implications of experimentation. Just as with experiments in other disciplines, there are worries about the epistemic conclusions that can be drawn (experiment in biology). The aim of experiments is to make causal inferences, by identifying connections between causes and effects (Millstein 2019). The problem is that it is not always easy to establish these causal connections: experiments can simply fail to establish any causal connection, the causal connection may be limited to the experimental setup, or even an artifact of the experimental setup (experiment in biology). In ecology, experiments are very heterogeneous, in terms of the type of experimental setup and the level at which they are conducted. In this context, heterogeneity is useful, at it can help us understand and categorize the epistemic issues arising from experimentation in ecology.

Ecological experiments can be divided into three categories, laboratory, field and natural experiments, each of which has epistemic advantages and disadvantages (Diamond 1986; Millstein 2019). Laboratory experiments are those where the perturbations are produced by the experimenter in the laboratory (Diamond 1986). The main advantage of laboratory experiments is that the experimenter has greater control over the biotic and abiotic environment, which is thought to provide greater confidence in the causal inferences that can be made from the experiment (Millstein 2019). However, this control comes at a cost: the laboratory setting is an artificial environment, that isolates phenomenon being investigated from the complex causal network it normally operates in. This means that the causal inferences established in the laboratory setting might not extend outside the laboratory (this is sometimes referred to as low external validity (Guala 2003). Natural experiments are much more realistic than laboratory experiments, because they do not take place in the artificial setting of the laboratory and can include many more species and perturbations (Millstein 2019). However, as the experimenter has no control over these variables their results yield much weaker causal inferences (this is sometimes referred to as low internal validity (Guala 2003). Field experiments fall in between laboratory and natural experiments in both dimensions, in the sense that they afford the experimenter some level of control but are also much less artificial than laboratory experiments as they provide scientists with more complete picture of the phenomenon under investigation (Diamond 1986; Thrush et al. 2000).

Ecological field studies, (i.e., field experiments and observational studies), deserve some additional attention, as they had an important role in the development of ecology as a scientific discipline (Sagarin & Pauchard 2010). The recognition that something is lost when populations are isolated in the laboratory, and that it is important to be able to observe community dynamics in all their complexity formed the basis of an alternative approach the study of ecological systems. This approach has been criticized regularly by both modelers and laboratory ecologists as un-scientific (see §3.1 and §3.5.1), yet it has persisted, in many parts and sub-disciplines of ecology, such as Elton’s niche theory and approach to the study of biological invaders (§2.2 and §2.3) ecosystem ecology and modeling (§2.1 and §3.5.1) and island biogeography. An important early landmark in the establishment of this general approach was the theory of succession (i.e., how a community develops after a disturbance such as a forest fire), whose ascent in the late nineteenth century was supported by a study of the regular patterns of vegetation variation on the sand dunes surrounding Lake Michigan, led by Henry Cowles. This, along with other field studies, showed that ecological systems outside the laboratory could have repeatable and predictable patterns which could form the basis of a theory (see discussion in Inkpen 2017).

3.6 Functions

Talk of “functions” is pervasive in ecology, in numerous contexts and at various scales, such as ecosystem functioning, functional diversity, functional types and so on (Jax 2005, 2010; Morrow 2023; Odenbaugh 2010, 2019a). Most ecological views on the nature and role of functions are closer to views in general philosophy of science than those in philosophy of biology. The main reason for this is that philosophers of ecology reject the traditional selected-effect view of functions, in the context of ecology (Dussault 2018; Maclaurin & Sterelny 2008; Morrow 2023; Nunes-Neto et al. 2014). The selected-effect view states that the function a trait is the activity that it was selected for performing. For example, the human heart has the function of circulating blood if, and only if, it evolved to do so by natural selection in the recent past (Godfrey-Smith 1994; Odenbaugh 2019a).

The problem with this account, for the ecological context, is that evidence about evolutionary history is not needed when making functional explanations in ecology (Dussault 2018; Morrow 2023; Odenbaugh 2019a). Some philosophers argue that they are better described as the roles of parts of an ecosystem that help explain the behavior of the ecosystem. The systemic capacity or causal role accounts of ecological function are based on Cummins’s (1975) view, which roughly states that a component of a system has a function when the capacity of a component helps to explain a capacity of the system (Lean 2021; Maclaurin & Sterelny 2008; Odenbaugh 2019a). For example, the capacity of detritivores to break down litter, help to explain the capacity of ecosystems to recycle nitrogen. One issue regarding role functions is whether they permit malfunctions, for example whether invasive species are dysfunctional. On a causal role theory, invasive species do not count as dysfunctional, which goes against some people’s intuitions (Lean 2021, see also discussion in Morrow 2023). Other open questions regarding causal role accounts are whether it is legitimate to assign functional roles to abiotic parts of the environment (Odenbaugh 2010) and whether they accurately identify the explanatory targets of ecologists (i.e., what ecologists are actually interested in explaining) (Dussault 2018).

Two other views are the persistence accounts, where functions contribute to the persistence of the system they are a part of (Dussault 2018), and the organizational accounts, where functions can roughly be understood as components that help to maintain the organization of the system they are a part of (Moreno & Mossio 2015; Nunes-Neto et al. 2014). Finally, Millstein (2020) argues that role functions are coevolved, so they can be understood as a type of selected effect function. For example, the function of pollinators is to help flowering plants to reproduce, because flowering plants and pollinators have coevolved together.

A parallel issue is whether role functions can be integrated or unified with other accounts of function in biology, or whether it is best to adopt a pluralistic account of functions for different contexts (Lean 2021; Morrow 2023). It is also possible to be a pluralist in a different sense, namely allowing that different functions exist at different levels of ecological hierarchy (see §3.4). For example, Odenbaugh (2019a) argues that Millstein’s version of selected effects functions can occur at the community level, yet only systemic capacity functions occur at the level of ecosystems.

3.7 Ecology as an Applied Science

There is a long-standing distinction in philosophy of science between science that is “pure” “basic” or “fundamental” and science that is “applied” (Douglas 2014; Roll-Hansen 2017). Historically, the distinction was meant to separate research that focused on building theoretical knowledge from research that merely applied the existing knowledge to solve particular problems in the real world (Carrier & Nordmann 2011; Douglas 2014). However, this distinction has been criticized, as many scientific disciplines, ecology included, routinely blend aspects of both pure and applied research (Douglas 2009; Kitcher 2001). Still, some philosophers have pointed out the distinction can be meaningful, as some research focuses on discovering and explaining phenomena while others focus more on identifying and solving problems in the world (Elliott-Graves, 2023; Justus 2021). Moreover, while epistemic values (those that directly help with the attainment of knowledge, such as truth, empirical adequacy, explanatory power, simplicity, generality, theoretical unity etc.) are important for both pure and applied research, in applied research, contextual values (sometimes called non-epistemic values) (those that arise from the social and/or ethical context within which a scientific investigation takes place) are particularly important (Douglas 2000; Justus 2021; Longino 1990; McMullin 1982; Rolin 2016; see also feminist epistemology and philosophy of science and scientific objectivity).

3.7.1 Values

It is uncontroversial to say that a significant proportion of ecological research is value-laden. For example, conservation biology (§2.4) is inherently and inescapably “ethically driven”, as ethical values affect how concepts such as biodiversity and nature are defined and measured, and how choices for various strategies for conservation are made and evaluated (Justus 2021, conservation biology). Nonetheless, there is some disagreement between philosophers about the role that non-epistemic values should play in applied sciences. On one view, termed “fact-value entanglement”, facts and non-epistemic values are inextricably linked and inseparable (Douglas 2009; Kincaid et al. 2007). Examples are often framed in terms of inductive risk, which can roughly be defined as the risk of accepting a hypothesis that is false or rejecting a hypothesis that is true (Magnus 2022). The idea is that there is always a level of uncertainty when it comes to accepting or rejecting a hypothesis, and that non-epistemic values play an important (though often overlooked) role in whether a hypothesis is accepted or rejected. Thus, for example, if we are trying to determine whether or not to allow logging in an area home to an endangered species (an example from the literature is that of the Northern Spotted Owl, see conservation biology, Justus 2021), the decision will be influenced by ethical considerations for the species in question, but also by considerations for the livelihood of the loggers, the local economy and so on.

One argument against this view, particularly relevant to ecology, is that focusing on non-epistemic values is problematic for the purposes of policy making, because if policies for conservation include non-epistemic values and these values are not widely shared, then the policy in question is unlikely to be successfully implemented (Burke & Lauenroth 2009; see discussion in conservation biology). Instead, the argument goes, facts are not only distinguishable from other values, but it is more likely to convince people (policy makers and the general public) that a policy will be successful if it focuses exclusively on the facts and does not bring in contextual values. Similarly, Justus (2021) argues that while non-epistemic values are important in applied ecology, it is possible to distinguish between fact and non-epistemic values. He argues that there has been conceptual and methodological progress in conservation biology, with the adoption of new and better methods for conservation planning. The adoption of these new methods, however, is due to considerations of facts and epistemic values, rather than non-epistemic values.

3.7.2 Interdisciplinarity

Interdisciplinarity and its relations are yet more concepts that are difficult to define (Grüne-Yanoff 2016; Klein 2010; Mäki 2016). For the purposes of this entry, we can understand interdisciplinarity as the collaborative integration of different disciplines for a common goal (Klein 2010).

Ecology & Evolution

There have been many instances throughout this entry, where the ecological definition or approach to a topic differed significantly to its evolutionary counterpart (e.g., §2.1.3, §3.6). Nonetheless, there are some research programs that bridge the gap between ecology and evolution. One such program that has received a lot of philosophical attention is niche construction. Put simply, niche construction occurs when organisms alter their environment, thus constructing their niche (Odling-Smee et al. 2013). For example, animals build nests, burrows and other artifacts, plants change the amount of nutrients or other chemicals in the soil and air and so on (Laland et al. 2016). By altering their environment in these ways, organisms change or create new selection pressures, thus influencing their own evolution (Levins & Lewontin 1985). There are roughly two parts to the process of niche construction. The first is the construction of the niche, for example through ecosystem engineering, where organisms actively alter their environment (Odling-Smee et al. 2013). Some biologists adopt a broader notion of “construction” to include behavioral changes, such as choosing a certain habitat, migration between habitats and various forms of adjustment or specialization (Odling-Smee et al. 2013; Trappes et al. 2022). The second part of niche construction is the effect of these changes on the evolution of the organisms. Changing the environment can change the selective pressures on the organisms within that environment, e.g., by adding or removing limiting factors such as temperature or shade. However, these effects are also explained by other adaptationist accounts of evolution, such as Richard Dawkins’s “extended phenotype” concept (Dawkins 1982 [1999]). Niche construction proper includes “ecological inheritance”, where populations pass on the modified environment to their offspring (see also inheritance systems).

Despite the potential of interdisciplinarity between ecology and evolution, Stephan Linquist (2019) argues that the two disciplines actually occupy “distinct epistemic niches”. He points out that some ecological explanations do not benefit from evolutionary details and vice versa. Therefore, scientists should investigate whether a combined eco-evo approach is likely to be fruitful for their research project, rather than assuming it is the best option.

Ecology and Economics

A notable example of methodological integration is the adoption of economic models into ecology and the subsequent cross-pollination of ideas between the two disciplines (Justus 2014; MacLeod & Nagatsu 2016; O’Malley & Soyer 2012). An important landmark was the adoption of Agent Based models from decision and game theory into ecology and their development into Individual-Based models. The adoption of these models spearheaded a recognition that many classical models in ecology were overly simplistic and unrealistic and highlighted the importance of adding more detail to ecological models (Railsback & Grimm 2011). At the same time, it has contributed to the adoption of “methodological individualism” as a genuine approach in ecology, which advances an individualistic understanding of the world, with moderate but not extreme levels of reductionism (Justus 2014; see also §2.1.4. & §3.4).

However, it should also be noted that some interdisciplinary endeavors between ecology and economics are widely criticized. For example, the field of ecological economics sought to monetize ecosystem services, so as to incorporate biodiversity and conservation goals into cost-benefit analyses, but has been criticized by economists and conservation biologists for failing to live up to expectations of either field (Norton & Noonan 2007).

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Acknowledgments

I would like to thank the PhiLiSci team at University of Bielefeld for helpful comments and feedback on the entry, especially Katie Morrow, for her extensive knowledge of the debate on functions in ecology.

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Alkistis Elliott-Graves <a.elliott-graves@uni-bielefeld.de>

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