Aesthetics and Race

First published Tue Sep 22, 2026

Aesthetics and race constitute areas of experience, evaluation, and historical practice that are vitally entangled with one another. This is to be expected, given that aesthetics is a culturally marked field of form, creation, and value, and race a realm of cultural constructions. Both practices sustain concepts and designs that speak to the other. As philosopher Cornel West argued in the 1980s, aesthetics is a generative element of modern racial discourses, by which he meant conceptual frameworks that run from late seventeenth-century classification systems to the present (West 1982). Notions of race and structures of racialization leave their marks in the modes of production, interaction, and response that human beings enact as participants in aesthetic endeavors, and the converse holds as well (Douglass 1861 [2015]; Du Bois 1926 [1986c]; Anzaldúa 1987 [1999]; hooks 1990 [2015], 1992 [2014]; Morrison 1992; Hall 1996a, 1996b; Davis, 1998, 2024; Gooding-Williams 2006; Roelofs 2014; Taylor 2016; Bradley and Ferreira da Silva 2021; Clavel-Vázquez 2023; Mokgosi 2024).

Entwinements between the two fields run through the plane of sensation/perception while simultaneously involving cultural constellations in a broad sense, such as institutional matrices and (trans)national frameworks—think, for example, of photographic technologies, paint pigments, representational codes, demographic taxonomies, and culture industries. Because aesthetics takes an interest in sensory experience and perception, it has an important role cut out for itself with regard to race: Racial categorization, as a dimension of quotidian experience, often relies on visual evidence (Du Bois 1940 [1986d]; Alcoff, 2006, 180, 187–88; Taylor 2016, 22; Hall 2017; Mokgosi 2024). Given aesthetics’ investment in sensory and perceptual appearances and the ways that these appearances assume meaning to human beings, aesthetic matters and racial phenomena significantly overlap. Moreover, as already suggested, the two domains centrally involve both social constructions (Alcoff, 182) and culturally situated institutions, performances, and productions, yielding yet more extensive common ground. Race is a ubiquitous presence in the aesthetic field. Aesthetics is a pronounced constituent of racialized experience.

Philosophical aesthetics, thus, faces the task of engaging race in a judicious manner. This is a multi-pronged endeavor, as this entry will indicate. Among other things, it necessitates that aesthetics take a distance from Eurocentric deployments of race in influential historical works. Examples are Kant’s views of racial difference in his theory of taste and beauty, and Burke’s ideas about the aesthetic impact of Blackness and Black skin in his account of beauty and the sublime. In response to these kinds of sources, including works by theorists as diverse as philosopher David Hume, art historian Johann Joachim Winckelmann, biologist Carl Linnaeus, anthropologist Johann Friedrich Blumenbach, and anatomist Petrus Camper, West (1982) identifies a “normative gaze” undergirding white supremacy (53–55), and stresses the racial productivity of beauty ideals in the cultural field. Analyzing further aspects of this problematic history, Richard Shusterman (1993) underlines the social dimensions of taste; Meg Armstrong (1996) analyzes the participation of beauty and the sublime in constructions of racial and gendered embodiment; and Robin James (2013) emphasizes the structural workings of privilege and oppression.

Racial typologies exert a powerful sensory grip on us. They take effect in aesthetic territory, where cognitive meanings and evaluative responses link up with various kinds of experiential input. W. E. B. Du Bois highlights such linkages. He observes how visible features—notably skin tone but also bone morphology and hair texture—constitute a “badge” of ancestry, or, in other words, a symbol that, despite the relative insignificance that accrues to it in its own right, holds paramount social importance as a “mark of heritage” (Du Bois 1940 [1986d], 639–40), that is, as evidence of racial identity. As Stuart Hall paraphrases Du Bois’s insight about the “badge of color” in particular (Du Bois, 639), “the ‘mark’ and the ‘badge’ are all-important because they signify, because they carry a certain meaning, because they are, in other words, signifiers of difference” (Hall 2017, 38–39). The relevant bodily attributes, for Du Bois (1897 [1986a], 817) “are clearly defined to the eye,” where this eye, as Hall points out, belongs to basically “everybody” (2017, 61). Hall’s observation testifies to a racial common sense: Since “seeing” closely approximates “believing,” the badges “absolutely, obviously, and incontrovertibly” inform the “untutored, unscientific eye” of racial “truths” (Hall 2017, 61–62). While race, thus, is in many ways sensed and felt as a register that is visually anchored in the body (see also Alcoff [2006, 191–94] on the perceptual and corporeal aspects of racial identities), there is a whole system of normative and interpretive protocols in action that undergirds the attendant web of recognizable cultural meanings: In Hall’s words, “What looks literally as if it fixes race in all its materiality—the obvious visibility of black bodies—is actually functioning as a set of signifiers that direct us to read the bodily inscription of racial difference and thus render it intelligible” (63). Given the at once sensory/perceptual, normative (note the aspect of direction), and interpretive facets of racial classifications, race is a pronounced part of the way that we experience and give meaning to existence. So conceived, race carries an expansive aesthetic resonance. For aesthetics, in outline, concerns our ways of building and making sense of the world, which revolve around sensory or perceptual factors and a slew of adjacent phenomena that we bring into play, such as cultural imaginaries, forms, norms, understandings, and modes of production. From the perspective of this schematic outlook on the entwinements between aesthetic and racial practices, this essay then analyzes central aesthetic effects, concepts, and procedures that bear on race’s reverberations in the aesthetic domain and on the aesthetic’s participation in racial constellations.

Throughout, the entry takes into account two sides of the aesthetic: its everyday routines (Saito 2007; 2017) and its artistic preoccupations. On the one hand, the realm of the aesthetic encompasses quotidian practices of making meaning, generating and responding to value, and realizing pleasures (or displeasures) as a part of experiences of human and more-than-human bodies, objects, and environments. On the other hand, the aesthetic domain houses art and other forms of cultural production. Race prominently impacts the aesthetic in both of these capacities: It enters aesthetics as a factor of ubiquitous aesthetic life and as a juncture of artistic and other kinds of cultural intervention. The essay thus considers how race is a player with regard to these two kinds of aesthetic concern.

The main project of the entry is to chart major philosophical lines of thought on the intersection of aesthetics and race. The essay starts with a brief genealogy and conceptual gloss of the notion of the aesthetic, to be followed by a selection of critical approaches to the aesthetic aspects and underpinnings of racial configurations and the racial facets and conditioning of aesthetic phenomena, or what Monique Roelofs (2014) calls aesthetic racialization and racialized aestheticization. These critiques will be given a place in a broader view of the aesthetic that situates it in relation to modernity/modernities, to a medley of cultural sources and inspirations, and to intersectional constructions of race and identity.

Theorizations of the interweavings of aesthetics and race face two fundamental philosophical problems or desiderata. The first issue concerns the job of doing justice to the complexities of human identities and the intricate logics of race as dimensions of social existence. Call this The Complexity of Identity/Racial Existence Problem. The second issue is to bring an adequate notion of critical making, reading, and experience to the meetings of aesthetics and race. Call this The Critical Making/Reading/Experience Problem. Both concerns are paramount because they single out phenomenological, interpretive, and normative dimensions of race and racialized experience, on the one hand, and aesthetic life, on the other, that hinge on the distinctive characteristics of the aesthetic. Race and racism are extensively debated in epistemological terms and through social science methods. Aesthetics brings its own lenses to these reflections. These lenses must be tailored to the phenomenological, interpretive, and normative specificities signaled by the Complexity of Identity/Racial Existence Problem and the Critical Making/Reading/Experience Problem. The two desiderata originate in part in the multi-sidedness of the aesthetic. In particular, they reflect the continual corporeal, imaginative, interpretive, and technologically and societally marked ways of folding into and onto itself of aesthetic experience, which involves our modes of making sense of and valuing the world while living in the midst of it and building it. This experiential logic presents subtleties that tend to elude rough and ready identifications that we are tempted to impose on it—subtleties that the two desiderata ask us to register. To develop a nonreductive account of aesthetic meaning and creativity, we thus need to work out a conscientious approach to these points. Rather than a quick societal fix or an enduring philosophical solution, as will be indicated, this requires an ongoing project of self-reflexive theoretical and praxical engagement.

James Baldwin sheds light on both the Complexity of Identity/Racial Existence Problem and the Critical Making/Reading/Experience Problem. For this reason, his insights will be given ample attention in this entry. He addresses the two desiderata by expressing reservations about routines of social categorization, and by associating art with inquiry into unasked questions and with the invention of new languages and forms. This creative venture gives a prominent role to aesthetic qualities such as beauty, ugliness, the tame, the stunning, and the vertiginous. While Baldwin speaks luminously to the two desiderata, as will be shown, and the significance of “things not seen,” as he calls it, is unabated today, contemporary theorists further advance our thinking on these issues. The remaining parts of the entry then develop two additional main themes and outlooks in the field, namely the intersection of aesthetics and politics, and critical phenomenological approaches to experience, especially aesthetic experience. The field of aesthetics and race is a vibrant research area that philosophy shares with numerous other disciplines, ranging from history to linguistics. Accordingly, the entry aims to provide a sense of central concepts and lines of thought that stretch across thematics, without aspiring to comprehensiveness regarding further, specific topics.

1. The History of Aesthetics and the Concept of the Aesthetic

Aesthetics is a field of reflection and practice, with roots in ancient and medieval traditions, that came into its own in Europe during the eighteenth century, as a part of the intellectual movement termed the Enlightenment. Philosophers such as Hume (1757 [1998]) and Kant (1790 [2000]) distinguished the aesthetic domain from ethics, politics, science, religion, and the marketplace. This distinctive territory was understood to include the fine arts, notably music, poetry, painting, sculpture, architecture, theater, and dance, which at the time all began to be comprehended as of a kind and gathered under a single umbrella term (Kristeller 1951, 1952). The category of art that arose from these discourses would in due course be expanded to include media such as film, performance, and installation. It lies at the core of contemporary views of art.

Both from its inception and today, however, aesthetics was and is a good deal more encompassing than art, as already suggested. Alongside aesthetic dimensions of artworks, Enlightenment thinkers acknowledged to varying degrees the aesthetic qualities of nature, human bodies, forms of design, food, and the built environment. Consequently, the concept of the aesthetic came to connote an encompassing kind of normativity that spanned natural phenomena, artworks, and other cultural productions, as well as people’s acts of making artifacts or participating in cultural performances and audiences’ responses to these different items.

Philosophy has developed a host of theories of art and methods of aesthetic analysis since the eighteenth century. Indeed, while profoundly intertwined with other disciplines, such as sociology and studies of the different arts, aesthetics is a central philosophical discipline, alongside metaphysics, epistemology, ethical and political thought, and logic. A short overview will be useful: Thinkers such as Shaftesbury, Hume, Kant, and Burke (1757 [1990]) proposed what they saw as universally valid standards of creation, perception, and judgment. For Kant (1790 [2000]), this relied on a free play of the cognitive powers of imagination and understanding. Picking up on the notion of aesthetic play, Friedrich Schiller (1795 [1967]) devised the so-called play-drive as a motor of aesthetically driven cultural development that was to reach its apex in the realization of the aesthetic state, by which he meant a condition of political freedom and equality. Happiness and human worthiness, he surmised, would at that point be shared among all people. Stressing a fundamental historicity, G. W. F. Hegel (1820–1929 [1975]) understood art as an historically evolving form of consciousness. This outlook inspired Karl Marx and subsequent generations of Marxist thinkers to develop historical materialist perspectives on culture that attend to the shifting social, economic, and technological conditioning of aesthetic life. From different angles, phenomenologists, poststructuralists, pragmatists, and feminists have stepped in to offer accounts of the corporeal, experiential, conceptual, and linguistic/symbolic structures of aesthetic existence. Meanwhile, the aesthetic is importantly associated with experiences of form or sensory appearance and with strategies of address that unfold between objects and publics (Hume 1757 [1998]; Hall 1996a; Saito 2007; Roelofs 2020; 2022). Through the dimensions of form and address, cultural artifacts and natural objects tie into their social, historical, and artistic/aesthetic contexts and give shape to, while exceeding, the contents they convey. Form and address also mark the aesthetic in its effusive quotidian functioning. For example, these factors bear on the question of whether and how one blends into a crowd or, by contrast, stands out from it. They pertain to the novel or entrenched ways in which observers encounter aesthetic objects and aesthetic objects reach out to their audiences. By stressing operations of form and address, aesthetic theory underscores orderings of aesthetic life that well surpass the universalist aspirations voiced in the Enlightenment. Thus aesthetics, from the start, establishes a conceptual scaffolding for the aesthetic field, which at later stages nourishes critical visions, as we will find.

Wrapping up a few key elements of the Western aesthetic tradition that form the background setting for critical tendencies, we find that this history presents us with a notion of the aesthetic—associated prominently with Kant—as involving: (1) a domain of autonomous valorizations grounded in individual judgment, by contrast to more communal, social practices; (2) an insistence on pleasure found in pure forms that inspire disinterested attention oriented toward discrete objects of appreciation (fostered by exhibition and performance venues); (3) the isolation of aesthetic experience and value from economic, political, and—to a certain degree—ethical meanings; (4) a view of beauty and art as sources of universal judgments grounded in common human faculties—judgments that abstract from contingency; that transcend temporal and geographical boundaries and historical context; and that support value rankings, placing what Hume (1757 [1998]) saw as enduringly excellent works at the zenith of the realm of cultural production; (5) a recognition of the special importance of the aesthetic as a realm of freedom and a sphere of creative agency and play (Kant, Schiller). It is against the backdrop (and to some extent by drawing on portions) of this basic outlook that critical, constructive perspectives open up alternative philosophical directions.

2. Critical Visions, Themes, and Textures

As revealed by the abbreviated genealogy of the previous section, the notion of the aesthetic is historically, conceptually, and institutionally allied to philosophical frameworks developed in the European Enlightenment. Key suppositions of these paradigms have been called into question: The view that individual perceivers are qualified to make universal aesthetic judgments masks restrictions on who actually was treated as so qualified, and whose aesthetic and other freedoms deserve protection. Aesthetic standing was not equally respected in the centuries of European conquest, but was implicated in colonial hierarchies and the maintenance of empire and other kinds of hegemonic power. Numerous thinkers have worked to expose these phenomena and aesthetics continues to demand critical readings that probe its Eurocentrism and entanglements with coloniality. Modes of thought, experience, and creation must be scrutinized for the racial and ethnic hierarchies and registers of nonbeing they encode. This project was launched by thinkers as diverse as Frederick Douglass (1861 [2015]), Anna Julia Cooper (1892 [1998]), Du Bois (1926 [1986c]), José Carlos Mariátegui (1928 [1971]), and Alain Locke (1925 [1997], 1936 [2000]). It gathered force during the subsequent anti-colonial struggles in the writings of C. L. R. James (1938 [1989]), Léopold Senghor (1939 [2003]; 1956; 1961 [2000]), Aimé Césaire (1939 [2001], and Frantz Fanon (1952 [2008]; 1961 [2004]). In the aftermath of successful independence movements worldwide, critics continued their scrutiny of aesthetics and its relationship to race and colonialism. Prominent writers include Baldwin (1998a; 1998c), Audre Lorde (1984a; 1984b; 1984c), Gloria Anzaldúa (1987 [1999]), Edward Said (1978), Paul Gilroy (1993), Homi Bhabha (1994), Stuart Hall (1994; 1996b), Silvia Wynter (1992; 2003), Ángel Rama (1984 [1996]), and Édouard Glissant (1990 [1997]). The project is carried on by a cadre of contemporary theorists, who follow in the footsteps of the earlier scholars. As the present section demonstrates, the critiques attest to the intricate nature and societal roles of the aesthetic.

While spelling out the imbrications of the aesthetic with practices of racialization, critical visions bring texture to our ideas about the relational, collective, and historical operations of the aesthetic. This leaves us with a rigorously amplified understanding of the aesthetic. Considering aesthetics in relation to race persistently belies smooth, timeless, abstract aesthetic theorizing. We cannot reflect on beauty or the sublime, say, without considering how these qualities have actually functioned as values in human societies. By examining several of the major critical interventions, we will be able to recognize the increased graininess and depth that our aesthetic practices assume when perused in view of their ties to coloniality and constructions of race. This section focuses on several aesthetic junctures that show how theorists pinpoint and build aesthetic textures in critical projects linking race and aesthetics. Although much work in this area attends to Black U.S. experiences of racialization and racism, the issues are emphatically diasporic and global, as is evident in this survey of themes and theorists.

History is a central theme in Édouard Glissant’s and Paul Gilroy’s approaches to aesthetics. Both scholars rethink colonial historiographies, constructions of modernity, and racial binaries marked by the cartographies of empire. The aesthetic implications they identify are consequential: Poetic forms of writing, making, and relating (Glissant 1990 [1997], 16–18, 23–35, 94–95) and Black musics (Gilroy 1993, 36–40, 72–110) not only dislodge given practices of knowledge production but also hold out alternative social potentialities. By singling out poetic and musical modes, Glissant and Gilroy then reveal how aesthetic idioms forge a reorganized fabric of cultural bonds and intersubjective alignments that escapes colonialist models.

To continue with the question of history and the project of creating and recognizing transformative social potentialities, other thinkers, such as Gloria Anzaldúa (1987 [1999]) and Homi Bhabha (1994), provide analyses of liminal spaces that unfold within and among subjects and within and among cultures that have historically been distinguished from one another along racial and ethnic lines and intersecting trajectories of social difference. For both theorists, liminal spaces are disjunctive locations. They are sites where historically entrenched social divides are unsettled. For instance, these zones of experience and subjectivity are neither exhaustively white or black, European or Asian or Latinx, Global North or Global South, colonial or oppositional, central or peripheral, but involve tensions between such stances. Friction between contrastive cultural frames, in Anzaldúa’s and Bhabha’s views, inheres in cultural agency. It constitutes a dynamical force. For Bhabha, the tensions occasion processes of cultural transcoding, translation, and becoming. In Anzaldúa’s optic, they nourish emerging paths of coalition building across received lines of difference. Both approaches drastically complicate established understandings of artists’ and audiences’ cultural positions.

Another set of issues revolves around the bodily aspects of existence. Rejecting oppositions between mind and body, among other dualities, Gloria Anzaldúa is an important theorist of corporeality. Along with this pathbreaking Latina feminist thinker, the Martiniquan postcolonial theorist Frantz Fanon (1952 [2008, 89–119]) and Black U.S. writer and activist Audre Lorde (1984c) elaborate involved dynamics of embodied experience and corporeally situated knowledge production encoded in aesthetic life. Reflecting on bodies, for Anzaldúa and Lorde, implies taking account of the gendered and class dimensions of racial constructions. These two feminists also attend to the workings of sexuality, age, and ability as registers of embodied life. In the form of stories, myths, and poetry, aesthetics is for Anzaldúa, Lorde, and Fanon a pivotal part of our sense of our bodies and of the ways in which we stand in the world, at the levels of emotion, sensation, imagination, and potentially transformative insight into the social fabric.

In an earlier epoch, Du Bois had emphasized affective and political dimensions of art and aesthetic experience, highlighting the sorrow as well as the hopefulness of Black songs, and describing art and literature’s capacities to affirm or contest white supremacy (Du Bois 1926 [1986c]; 1903 [1986b], 544; see also Taylor 2016, 77–103]; Gooding-Williams 2025). Indeed, art—and, more broadly, technologies such as photography, as politician, theorist, and abolitionist Frederick Douglass (1861 [2015], 133) points out—participate in logics of racial and ethnic identity in ways that are both terrible and emancipatory. As he presciently observes, “Daguerre [a major figure in the invention and spread of photography, who lived from 1787 to 1852)] … has converted the planet into a picture gallery” (127). This aesthetic change is tremendously consequential: “As to the moral and social influence of pictures,” Douglass states, “it would hardly be extravagant to say of it, what Moore has said of ballads, give me the making of a nation’s ballads and I care not who has the making of its laws. The picture and the ballad are alike, if not equally social forces—the one reaching and swaying the heart by the eye, and the other by the ear” (129). Thus photography, among other representational practices, is charged with a hefty epistemic, moral, and political task: “Conscience itself is misdirected: shocked at delightful sounds, beautiful colors and graceful movements—but sleeps at ease amid the ten thousand agonies of war and slavery” (133). Pictures have the power to turn around this subversion of sensibility. By addressing feeling and imagination and, at the same, time providing a window into the realm of truth and reality distinct from ideology, photography, according to Douglass, can serve as a force of goodness, justice, liberty, fellow-feeling, and human development, and an antidote to prejudice and oppression (133, 141). He puts deeds to words, gaining him the moniker of the most photographed American of the nineteenth century (Stauffer, Trodd, and Bernier, 2015). Questions of freedom and equality, for Douglass and later for Du Bois and Lorde, as we can say with a nod to Schiller (see section 2), are deeply entwined with aesthetics.

Considering patterns of identification and identity formation more broadly, Hall (1994; 1996b; 1996c) and Glissant (1990 [1997]) join forces in arguing that identities must be seen as evolving positions in webs of aesthetically mediated relationships. Additionally, scrutinizing the dynamics of structured social practices, theorists develop a rich awareness of the institutional and conceptual organization conditioning artistic invention, evaluation, and reception (Cooper 1892 [1998]; Du Bois, 1926 [1986c]; Mariátegui 1928 [1971, 182–287]; Rama 1984 [1996]; Wynter 1992; 2003). These, then, are some of the crucial themes brought out by a range of canonical thinkers on the subject of aesthetics and race. As this short selection of topics demonstrates, the critical literature on race ascribes an involved, thickly layered phenomenal and societal texturing to the aesthetic.

3. Aesthetics, Race, and Modernity

The critical racial visions discussed in the previous section make clear that the aesthetic conjoins oppressive and liberatory forces. It comprises powers of good and evil. What does this ambivalence tell us about the status of the aesthetic? How might it bear on the possibility of a critical aesthetics? In an account of art’s ties to freedom and social possibility that touches on what she interprets as a diminishing image of Africa in a Kendrick Lamar performance, Angela Davis says that “While I loved the performance, I have critiques as well. We should all recognize that it’s possible to be supportive and to be critical at the same time” (2024, 58–59). Voicing reservations about a “corporate capitalist dimension” in Beyoncé’s work, she observes that “one can intensely appreciate an aesthetic experience and at the same time be ambivalent about it” (59). Davis’s insight holds a lesson for the aesthetic, understood as a register of modernity—a cultural framework that carries significant weight to date.

Modernity, by which I roughly mean the cultural paradigm that emerged toward the end of fifteenth century Europe with the advent of the Conquest and other colonial enterprises, has long been considered the purview of Europe. This view positions Europe’s racial and colonial others as nonmodern or only derivatively or mimetically modern, that is, modern in a pejorative manner. Consequently, the notion of modernity—which often assumes different accents for different thinkers—holds a poignant charge in the cultural territory covered by this essay. For example, Du Bois’s remarks on the “badge of color” and the “mark of heritage” (1940 [1986d], 639–40) take as their reference point the modern era from the fifteenth century onward (639). West’s aesthetic “genealogy of modern racism” (1982, 47–48, 65) focuses on Enlightenment accounts stretching from the late seventeenth century through the contemporary, postmodern era. Without purporting to streamline discourses of modernity, which would divert us from our topic, the current section signals certain pertinent facets of the historically situated entanglements among aesthetics, race, and modernity. The upshot will be that an aesthetic stance that looks critically onto forces of coloniality and race does not mandate a full-fledged uncoupling from modernity and aesthetics, as readers of decolonial approaches, such as Mignolo and Vázquez (2013) and Mignolo (2021), often infer, but contains critical and experiential resources that steer away from Eurocentric and racist constructions of exemplary vs. distorted modernity and modernity vs. the nonmodern. Thus modern aesthetics, when adequately reconceptualized, preserves a basic, though thoroughly reconstrued, ethical and political promise that the Enlightenment associated with it.

3.1 Aesthetics as a Modern Critical Engagement with Modernity

The language of modernity calls attention to a germane characteristic of the aesthetic: From the time of its emergence nearly three centuries ago, aesthetics has served as a counter-discourse to Enlightenment epistemologies and metaphysics. Aesthetics has done so by confronting modern constructions of reason with affective, sensory, corporeal, imaginative, and societal conditions that outstrip these constructions. As Schiller (1795 [1967]) and Dewey (1934) argued, the aesthetic brings together elements of reason and emotion and sensation, mind and body, public and private, individual and society. In this integrative capacity, the aesthetic is found to make valuable cultural contributions. Schiller theorized these phenomena under the rubric of the “play-drive,” which mediates between humanity’s sensory and rational drives to actualize a political state of freedom and equality, or what he labels the “aesthetic state” (1795 [1967, 75–99, 205–19]; see also section 2). He associates the integrative or mediating dynamic of the aesthetic, conceived of in terms of play, with an eventual overcoming of subjective fissures attendant on the modern division of labor and increasing specialization in the workplace (31–43).

Analogous mediating operations appear in John Dewey’s influential twentieth-century account of aesthetic experience. Much like Schiller, he holds that aesthetic integrations ameliorate social compartmentalization (Dewey 1934, 20–34). For Dewey, the aesthetic conjoins mind and body; thinking and sensing, feeling, and imagination; doing and undergoing; and subject and object, among other oppositions (20–22, 43–57, 246, 258–59, 287–88). In this capacity, it bridges rifts of subjective experience and between classes, races, nations, and cultures produced by global capitalism and its attendant institutional conditions of industry, international commerce and trade, and politics (8–10, 333–49). Empire and coloniality must be added to these societal factors, although Dewey’ aesthetics barely and mostly implicitly touches on these latter phenomena and, without so much as a blink, reproduces categories of the primitive and savage (9, 196). Clearly, constructions of both reason and affect, as well as their connections and ties to imagination and embodiment, sustain racial differentiations and enact racial phenomenologies and politics (Fanon 1952 [2008, 94–119]; Ahmed 2004; Roelofs 2014, 117–23, 138–47; da Silva 2007, 17–90). While the integrative functioning of the aesthetic by no means forecloses the operations of the aesthetic as a site of unjust differentiations and inequities, it amounts to a structurally entrenched interplay of forces in which competing cultural drives are negotiated (Roelofs 2014, 146–47).

The insight that tension and ambivalence are inherent facets of the aesthetic illuminates a salient aspect of the critical visions examined in section 2: These projects are rife with aesthetic notions, with references to artforms such as literature and music, and with vocabulary such as poesis, articulation, expression, and criteria of judgment. The ample presence of aesthetic terminology as a component of the inner logic of the critical outlooks shows that these efforts are not attempts to suspend or jettison aesthetics in a totalizing sense. They must be seen as endeavors to rethink aesthetic terminology and to reconfigure the nature of the aesthetic. Regarding the questions raised at the start of section 3, I propose then that the critiques are interventions into an ineradicably conflicted, multivalent discourse of aesthetics, rather than stances that unfold outside of it or accounts that establish or anticipate uncompromised aesthetic paradigms.

The view of the critical projects sketched here is central to a modern (and, by extension, postmodern) aesthetics: A self-reflexive aesthetics, that is, a framework that takes a careful look at its own theoretical presuppositions and societal investments, engages in immanent critique, or, in other words, in a mode of critical analysis that situates itself inside rather than outside the conceptual framework that is being challenged. On this view, the critical visions sustain ties to the system they put under the lens. This doesn’t mean that the system is bound to stay as it is or that stasis is the most that can be hoped for. By contrast, the critical scrutiny occasions local ruptures in aesthetic frameworks. It produces dissonances in a system that, in the process, is being revised and opened up to alternative understandings. So, although the aesthetic is an assemblage of polyvalent cultural tendencies and contradictory impulses with which the critiques fail to make a crisp break, critical interventions are necessary to lead this medley of forces into ethically and politically desirable directions. Indeed, by challenging the Western ethnocentrism and racism that are part of the aesthetic, the critical agendas of Du Bois, Anzaldúa, and more recent scholars bring to light powerful cultural dynamics, which they orient toward values such as justice and equity and processes of democratization (Gooding-Williams 2025; Ortega 2025). Aesthetics need not be surrendered in consequence of the problems of modernity but calls for processes of critical aesthetic engagement. A critical aesthetics is both necessary and possible. Art, its making and experience, as well as everyday aesthetic life, sustain an ineradicable ethico-political, epistemic, and aesthetic promise.

3.2 Modernity and the Aesthetic Construction of Identity

Having just discussed the attainability of a critical position at the intersection of aesthetics, race, and modernity, the present section spotlights the angle of cultural experience and identity. Hall’s work exemplifies the kind of immanent, tension-juggling investigation of culture and aesthetics I have described in the previous section. In his discussion of the effects of the capitalist marketplace and cultural institutions on black popular culture, he points out that black popular culture is everything but “pure” (1994, 400; 1996b, 469–72, 474). Indeed, black music, film, and everyday aesthetic performances, such as linguistic invention, hairstyles, gaits, and other figurations of the body, for him, constitute modes of negotiation and dialogical encounter with multiple cultural sources, forces, and traditions. Hall observes an interplay of factors that bely decisive demarcations in terms of good and bad, authentic and inauthentic, elite and popular, and resistance to or complicity with exclusionary and oppressive cultural systems (469–72). The aesthetic, accordingly, is fundamentally impure territory in his eyes.

By examining Hall’s account more closely, we can gain a further crucial insight into contemporary aesthetic practices. For he develops his remarks on the impurity of black popular culture into a point about this culture’s modernity. Having noted the absence of “pure forms,” he proceeds to give a gloss on what the forms of this culture actually look like:

Always these forms are the product of partial synchronization, of engagement across cultural boundaries, of the confluence of more than one cultural tradition, of the negotiations of dominant and subordinate positions, of the subterranean strategies of recoding and transcoding, of critical signification, of signifying. Always these forms are impure, to some degree hybridized from a vernacular base. Thus, they must always be heard, not simply as the recovery of a lost dialogue bearing clues for the production of new musics (because there is never any going back to the old in a simple way), but as what they are—adaptations, moulded to the mixed, contradictory, hybrid spaces of popular culture. They are not the recovery of something pure that we can, at last, live by. In what Kobena Mercer calls the necessity for a diaspora aesthetic, we are obliged to acknowledge they are what the modern is. (Hall 1996b, 471)

The aesthetic forms and idioms of black cultural productions, such as the “new musics” that Hall discusses, emerge as items of modern culture, artifacts built from modern media. The aesthetic, to extrapolate from Hall’s invocation of a “diaspora aesthetic,” is a necessary register fueling these practices of creation and invention. Concrete contemporary art practices enact aesthetics as a dimension of navigations, strategies of subjective constitution, and practices of community building across cultural divides and hierarchies (1994, 402). Hall here offers a vital insight into the nature of cultural traditions in the modern era. Rather than stable givens, they are frameworks that are being forged. The aesthetic has a considerable hand in this for Hall: Cultural roots and identities are being produced during a process of aesthetic creation (Hall 1994, 395, 402). Under modernity, he makes clear, identities are aesthetic constructions. And modernity (along with postmodernity, which is commonly considered part of it), far from a uniform framework, is a heterogeneous, partially contradictory cultural reality, a field of cultural practices that yields identities built from a motley collection of aesthetic sources and impulses, many of which are ineluctably tarnished by forces of oppression. Given that contemporary Black art and aesthetics are part of modernity, disassociating from modernity in a wholesale fashion implies surrendering these practices. Accordingly, impurity is our lot.

3.3 Modernity/Modernities: Race and Intersectionality

This section looks more closely at the dynamics of modernity and the multiple, interweaving voices and aesthetic positionings it entails. The modern epoch in Europe, which, as noted before, for present purposes is usefully associated with the end of the fifteenth century, saw the systemic deployment of notions of race in the context of colonialism, empire, and attendant forms of conceptualization. As a register of knowledge production allied with structures of power (Foucault 1976 [1978, 135–152]), race entered fundamentally into the construction of societies globally, settling into gendered, sexual, pedagogical, administrative, and class stratifications and notions of the human, regulating matters of life and death, and disciplining humanity, in Alexander Weheliye’s words, “into full humans, not-quite-humans, and nonhumans” (Weheliye 2014, 3; see also Mbembe 2013 [2017, 1–77]; 2010 [2021, 44, 52–89]). Rather than being a one-sided import from metropolitan centers to colonized territories, as theorists have observed, the institutional conditioning of racial delineations and classifications—for example through educational practices and principles of public health and hygiene—affected ongoing constructions of racial identity across these societal contexts (Stoler 1995, 95–136). Local and global arrangements enter into a complex interplay on this vision. Registers of class, gender, and sexuality, analogously, interlace in a contingent fashion with notions of racial identity (and vice versa), leaving their marks on people’s aesthetic positioning under modernity, that is, their positions in an aesthetic playing field.

The term intersectionality recognizes the co-imbrication of these structures and categories of social difference and identification. Both Lorde (1984a) and Hall (1996a, 444) develop intersectional views of aesthetic practice, dispelling the idea that categories such as blackness, whiteness, femininity, and class denote unitary cultural and aesthetic positions. To recognize the workings of social difference, we need to comprehend these constructions as internally differentiated formations.

Hall’s and Lorde’s intersectional views have rich implications for aesthetics. I will give two examples. For Hall, the surrender of “essential categories” shifts considerations of aesthetic value from a belief in transcendent criteria toward a politics of criticism, which he associates with an ongoing practice of critical discourse that “works with and through difference” toward coalitional engagements (1996a, 444, 448). Aesthetic judgments and values, in his view, thus encode contingent positions in a cultural politics and are to be devised and interpreted as such. Existent artistic canons and their categories do therefore not suffice as grounds by reference to which the relevant artistic and aesthetic criteria can be legitimized. Cultural criticism needs to come up with a different “mode of address” to do justice to the qualities of contemporary cultural productions (448–49). Hall fleshes this idea out by reference to examples of the kinds of critical interpretations of artworks’ aesthetic and racial dimensions that this view makes possible and of readings that it rules out.

Lorde’s intersectional view, likewise, highlights questions of value and speaks to our ability to assess and reassess what actually is or isn’t of value to us. Not unlike Schiller and Dewey, she emphasizes the aesthetic importance of feeling and emotion (Lorde 1984c). More than that, she calls attention to an existential aesthetic resource, the erotic, in which she locates a vital female power. In her own case, she associates it with feelings and forms of awareness and participation that she has as a Black lesbian feminist (1984d, 59). Getting in touch with the erotic, for her, then involves attending to experiences and meanings she realizes at this particular intersection of gendered, racial, and sexual structures. More generally, she connects the erotic with an ability for self-affirmation “in the face of a racist, patriarchal, and anti-erotic society” (59). With the notion of the erotic, Lorde identifies a capacity for deep feeling, joy, connectedness, sensation, and creativity in areas such as poetry, dance, physical construction chores, and reflection. As this gloss indicates, the aesthetic is a conspicuous part of the erotic. She describes the generativity of the erotic in terms of a flow and coloration that suffuses her existence, providing her “life with a kind of energy that heightens and sensitizes and strengthens all [her] experience” (57). It nourishes an ability to gauge “the quality of all the aspects of our lives and of our work, and of how we move toward and through them” (55). Thus the erotic brings to light “the way in which our world can be truly different” (55). Moreover, an embrace of this propensity makes possible a way of connecting with similarities and differences between the self and others (59). A deep sharing and mutual participation becomes possible, which can then lead to unprecedented “joint concerted actions” and reverberate in social change (59). To access the erotic, she makes clear, women need to distance, rather than conform to, “an exclusively european-american male tradition” (59). Embracing the erotic thus both requires and allows for aesthetic positionings that elude the forms of experience concentrated in this particular, narrowly circumscribed, intersection. Lorde enacts a creative and critical stance that philosophy needs to recognize, rather than efface in a sweeping surrender of modernity. Intersectional aesthetics, in short, shows us that, under modernity, the aesthetic is more than a “monolithic” model, to borrow from Hall (1996a, 449), and upholds crucial cultural promises (Roelofs 2014).

In recent decades, aesthetics has become increasingly attentive to a range of intersectional operations marking its experiential logic and social functioning. While Western modernity yields influential notions of race, this, once again, does not mean that modernity is a singular phenomenon. Indeed, modern lifeworlds are inflected by mutually constitutive registers of difference, including historical, regional, national, local, and global dynamics in whose contexts gendered, sexual, and class dimensions assume their variable roles. Accordingly, theorists such as the critic and curator Okwui Enwezor underline the need to acknowledge the contributions of multiple modernities to a global world of art (2008, 220–22; 2010, 595–98, 609–16).

While the notion of modernity is a fraught category, and aesthetics, in consequence of its entwinements with modernity, inherits pernicious racial and colonial tendencies, this does not irrevocably undermine the importance and effects of modernity or situate theorists such as Du Bois, Hall, and Lorde outside of this model, but calls for continuing critical perspectives on a multivalent heritage that marks contemporary cultural experience and identity. Art and everyday aesthetics carry substantive critical, constructive, and liberatory potentialities.

This point brings us back to Angela Davis, with whom we started this section. In her view, art is a pivotal force of “freedom and justice,” one that does not bring about these states “once and for all” but fosters “a constant movement” toward them, a movement “that is both comforting and troubling” (2024, 54). Further explicating this idea, she highlights Kant’s association of the aesthetic with a kind of imaginative experience that sidelines regular cognition (2024, 56). More than that, she indicates how art and critical theory are affiliated ventures in the sense that both employ strategies of “negative dialectics” (54). She understands this practice, by reference to Marcuse, as a move away from “what is” toward possibility, that is, in the direction of “what might be” (54). Davis remarks in this light on the centrality of artists in the Black Lives Matter (BLM) movement. BLM, she signals, subscribes to an emphatically intersectional vision (58). And it believes that “art can educate the imagination” (58). For Davis, aesthetics is an essential component of this political project.

4. Two Problems: Baldwin on Complexity, Critique, and Creativity

“Literature and sociology,” James Baldwin declares, “are not one and the same” (1998b, 15). With this claim, he underscores the emotional, imaginative, and conceptual plenitude of aesthetic form and experience, which art can mobilize to stretch the limits of what we are willing to comprehend and feel. In distinguishing literature from sociology, Baldwin makes room for the specificity of the aesthetic, which resides in the phenomenological, interpretive, and evaluative meanings that we can sustain as creators and audiences of aesthetic productions and as everyday aesthetic agents. Aesthetic specificity must be embraced rather than effaced. Yet there are powerful impulses to hem it in. Inherited social classifications, Baldwin contends, often represent human beings as “ciphers” (16), that is as schematic figures, instead of the ample, full-fledged beings that we are. Simplification serves a purpose: It allows us to avoid insights that are hard to face. Art and its aesthetic experience, however, refuse this comfort. Thus Baldwin pleads for an aesthetics that meets racial delineations with a responsiveness to the Complexity of Identity/Racial Existence Problem and to the Critical Making/Reading/Experience Problem, described at the start of this essay.

What reply does he offer to these problems and why are they important? One major concern revolves around the damaging effects on black people of the “white world’s definitions” of them (1998c, 291–95, 326). This destructiveness is to be averted. More generally, however, received social categories, such as notions of race, have a tendency to backfire. Baldwin observes,

Our passion for categorization, life neatly fitted into pegs, has led to an unforeseen, paradoxical distress; confusion, a breakdown of meaning. Those categories which were meant to define and control the world for us have boomeranged us into chaos; in which limbo we whirl, clutching the straws of our definitions. (1998b, 15)

Clinging to social categories in order to render life manageable on given terms results in a loss of meaning. Aesthetic inquiry, for Baldwin, by contrast, recognizes the ways in which human beings escape definition (13). It declines to avert difficult truths by ensnaring us in ignorance, which results in violent effects (15–16) and a flattened self-understanding. Indeed, artists enable their publics to embark on a “journey toward a more vast reality” (13). In facing up to a “disquieting complexity” (13), freedom can be attained. “[O]nly within this web of ambiguity, paradox, this hunger, danger, darkness,” stresses Baldwin, “can we find at once ourselves and the power that will free us from ourselves” (13). Art that embraces this complexity is a practice of “revelation” (13; 1998a, 672). Baldwin presents art and aesthetics with the challenge to recognize the Complexity of Identity/Racial Existence. In reducing it, cultural productions such as protest novels and works of mass art become formulaic and threaten our diminishment and demise (1998b, 13; 2010b).

Baldwin, here, calls on art’s capacity to bear witness to reality (2010a, 43; Lester, 1984). Given that “the truth about us is always at variance with what we wish to be” (1998a, 671), aesthetic creation wrestles with the painful, “unasked” questions that life throws in our path (1985, xii–xiii, 7–9; 1998a, 670; 2010a, 43), showing us a world that is more ample than what received categorizations enable us to see. A new language must be invented. “Our unknown selves” demand “a new act of creation” (1998b, 16–17). Artists take up this formal and expressive task. The new language is to be capacious enough to describe the brutality inflicted on Black people. It must be a language “of the heart” that can articulate pain (1998c, 326; 1998d, 782; 2010a, 46). It needs to be sufficiently open-ended to hold “unsettling questions” and to bring to articulation double binds and contradictory desires (1998b, 15). It revises the racial premises of hegemonic languages (2010c, 114).

By telling stories that enter this difficult territory rather than producing familiar, already known morality tales, art frees us. This aesthetic endeavor offers vital affective, imaginative, and epistemic rewards: We discover “that life is tragic, and, therefore, unutterably beautiful” (1998a, 671). It is this kind of art that can sustain the possibility of social transformation for the better (1998b, 16–17). Art probes, taking given stories as a starting point for a trajectory of undaunted questioning, not as an answer. Further aesthetic qualities guide and shape the creative process: In 1959, he states that we need to interrogate why “the lives” led in the U.S. “are mainly so empty, so tame, and so ugly” (2010b, 5–6). In this country, he observes twenty years later, both white and black people occupy “strange” positions (2010c, 116). He subsequently remarks how white supremacy locates Black people in a “stunning and vertiginous place” (1985, 94). Aesthetic inquiry confronts institutionalized narratives with their limits. The big “hole” these discourses produce becomes legible (xiii–xiv).

The new language crafted by the artist builds hitherto unarticulated or unprecedented connections and disconnections between individual and society, and thereby reveals both personal and communal identities (Baldwin 1998d, 781). Thus it holds resources to give expression to the complexities and movements that, Baldwin warns us, entrenched systems of categorization tend to block, at society’s peril. This includes, in Baldwin’s oeuvre, the naming of complex sexual desires—queer and otherwise—invisibilized by heteronormative mores. A beauty that otherwise threatens to be snuffed out is recovered (1998b, 18). People will be in a position to “re-establish their connection with themselves, and with one another” (2010b, 6). In this way, we can hope for social change. For Baldwin, the production of a new language—or, more broadly, an artistic vocabulary—is a political process, for “language,” he says, “is … a political instrument, means, and proof of power” (1998d, 781). Art, for Baldwin, thus is a political project.

As stated in the introduction to this entry, Baldwin advances our thinking on two major philosophical problems regarding the relations between aesthetics and race: the Complexity of Identity/Racial Existence Problem and the Critical Making/Reading/Experience Problem. The first is the question of how we can render our theories and practices responsive to the complexities of race and social identity. The second is the question of what adequate conceptions of critical making, reading, and experience might look like in the zones where the aesthetic meets with structures of racialization. This latter question specifically thematizes the nature of the critical interpretation and aesthetic experience of cultural productions, including art.

Baldwin tackles the Complexity of Identity/Racial Existence Problem simply by bringing it to consciousness and providing a vocabulary for discussing it. Describing and recognizing the issue is a first step toward addressing it. He encourages us to take cognizance of the fact, even the strong likelihood, that we may be deploying categories in a manner that forecloses troubled facets of racial life and social existence and that narrows the involved web of reciprocal interactions binding together self and world. Equipped with this awareness, we are in a position to come up with an alternative attitude toward the offending categories. Once we are attentive to the tendency of classifications to shut out and stultify parts of life in a manner that backfires, we can counter it. Thus, Baldwin requires conceptual vigilance, pliability, and creativity. Note that he doesn’t dismiss the practice of categorization but advocates a shrewd, qualified approach to it. He demands an ongoing process of reflection on the functioning of social categories that is open to revising them in confrontation with realities that elude them. Call this strategy Categorial Self-Reflexivity.

Like other kinds of social undertakings, critical making, reading, and experience in the cultural field necessitate Categorial Self-Reflexivity. As a critic of art and other forms of cultural production, Baldwin employs this approach for instance in differentiating artifacts that engage in “sociological” cogitation from ones that engage in creative invention. This strategy is all the more important in the case of art. For Baldwin, as we have seen, art is the social endeavor par excellence that attains Categorial Self-Reflexivity through inquiry, narration, and linguistic and formal invention. To do justice to an artwork’s form and content, our practices of cultural criticism and aesthetic experience must then meet the work’s Categorial Self-Reflexivity with their own. This is a necessary condition for acknowledging art’s critical charge. Thus, Baldwin’s engagement with the first problem doubles as a response to the second problem.

Baldwin brings to light additional strategies through which we can be responsive to the desiderata presented by the Critical Making/Reading/Experience Problem. First, the cultural critic and aesthetic perceiver or participant should be open to the new languages, forms, and inquiries put forth by cultural artifacts. Secondly, aesthetic agents and observers must attend to the ways in which aesthetic forms—linguistic or otherwise—intervene into the connections and disconnections between self and society. Thirdly, they need to be alert to the politics of aesthetic form as a part of their readings, experiences, and modes of participation. Fourthly, by picking up on aesthetic qualities, such as the tragic or the strange, they will be able to register and nourish the creative, affective, and interpretive possibilities these qualities convey.

As Eddie Glaude points out in a reading of Baldwin’s oeuvre that highlights the writer’s pertinence to present-day concerns, Baldwin’s writing “constantly folds back on itself” (2020, xxvii). With this creative strategy, Baldwin captures an analogous logic that marks the aesthetic: Aesthetic experience is capable of energizing and modulating itself in an open-ended movement. This dynamism yields rich resources we can mobilize in response to the Complexity of Identity/Racial Existence Problem and the Critical Making/Reading/Experience Problem. Here we encounter a fifth strategy through which we can hope to answer to these desiderata: It is crucial to embrace rather than quench the generative circulations of aesthetic experience. As Baldwin’s case illustrates, this is a process, not an endpoint. Problematizing Baldwin’s masculinism and his erasure of women and, at times, of queerness, Michelle Wright theorizes a Black multidimensionality in his texts owing to a combination of a linear progress narrative and phenomenological reflection on the moment, which “involves a potentially endless set of negotiations” (2015, 113, 116, 138). We need to keep animating the “evidence of things not seen,” to speak with Baldwin’s (1985) title.

Baldwin’s proposals reverberate in a variety of contemporary approaches. I will mention three examples. One, art historian Sarah Lewis (2024) documents the power of unseeing as a mechanism underpinning white hegemony in U.S. visual culture from the Civil War to World War I. By unseeing the reality of Muslim populations in the Caucasus, popular culture and visual art promoted the image of this region as a site of racial whiteness. “Sight,” she contends, “became a form of racial sculpture; vision became a knife excising what no longer served the stability of racial hierarchy” (2). We see here how what Baldwin terms the “evidence of things unseen,” brings to light racial fictions and exposes the fragmentation, spuriousness, and unsteadiness of mainstream notions of race. To move to my second example, Baldwin’s remarks on aesthetic qualities find an uptake in Cornel West’s account of the truth-telling capabilities of the tragicomic mode, as epitomized by the blues, and the centrality of this mode to a present-day engagement with catastrophe (2004, 16, 19–22). For West, the tragicomic enables us to grapple with what we would rather shun and, more than that, to realize “a way of life” that finds joy and sustenance in the face of a pervasive emptiness and ugliness and enduring forces of dehumanization (20, 41, 92–93). The tragicomic embodies an “elemental” kind of freedom, “like laughter, dance, and music,” and, so conceived, constitutes a mainstay of democracy (217). By singling out the democratizing impulse of this aesthetic form, among other forces, West theorizes democracy as a political form that widely exceeds electoral politics (15). My third example concerns the racial workings of humor and comedy. From an analytic philosophical perspective, Luvell Anderson explores comic roasts and the role of insult as a part of their funniness and ability to provide mirth (2020a). He singles out the effectivity with which utterances direct attention to their form, as opposed to their content, as a significant factor in rendering a roast successful or disagreeable (458–60, 462–63). In a more general discussion of jokes, Anderson differentiates racially insensitive jokes from racist jokes as well jokes that are merely racial (2020b, 378–79). Zeroing in on new vocabularies and visions in global Black culture, Jessyka Finley (2020, 440) describes transnational strategies of obscenity and transgression in contemporary Black diasporic women artists’ stand-up comedy, and reveals how these performers employ these and related strategies to create new articulations of subjectivity (448). Contemporary scholars thus provide further entries into Baldwinian themes such as the unseen, witnessing, aesthetic qualities, and the creation of new languages, deepening our understanding of the roles of these modalities in various creative practices.

5. Aesthetics and Politics

The intersection of aesthetics and race concerns many of the areas understood as political in a broad sense of the term: It involves allocations of power. This intersection is a domain of contested meanings ascribed to social and bodily differences. It pertains to the shifting sensibilities through which we experience and register such meanings. It enacts values such as justice and injustice. The territory is shaped by conditions of inclusion within and exclusion from institutional settings. It involves distributions of resources and opportunities for gathering together, fostered by public infrastructures. Accordingly, the aesthetics-race intersection importantly implicates the ways in which aesthetics ties into (or veers away from) politics. This section considers several approaches in this area, bringing out how theorists and artists place value on critical resistance but also go beyond sheer modalities of critique and resistance to highlight future-looking political promises of the aesthetic, and to call attention to the transformative potentialities of registers such as attentiveness, intimacy, care, eroticism, fabulation, and spirituality.

5.1 Multiplicity

As noted before, aesthetics must recognize the complexity of race and identity and employ suitable notions of critical reading, making, and experience. In defining Black aesthetics in the field of poetry, poet-scholar Evie Shockley proposes a rich view that speaks to both concerns. She refers to the “evidence … in the text” of writers’ “desire to write with, against, around, about, and/or in spite of ideas or issues of race, particularly concerning black identity and cultures” (2011, 9). More specifically, she mentions writers’ possible “wrangling with competing expectations or desires for whether and how race will function in her work” (9). For the purposes of this section, Shockley is usefully read as signaling a politics of textuality that harbors a multiplicity of modes of aesthetic engagement (or nonengagement) with race on the part of the poem and that demands from the reader an interpretive and experiential responsiveness to that very multiplicity. In this fashion, the complexity of race and identity echoes in the specific strategies of the aesthetic production by the artist and in the complexity of the reading and aesthetic experience of the interpreter, answering to both key desiderata.

Multiplicity, likewise, is a principal factor in Paul Taylor’s (2016) view of Black aesthetics in terms of an assembly of contingent practices and interests. These activities form evolving constellations that do not necessarily internally cohere with each other in an overall vision: They are fundamentally heterogeneous (2016, 3–5). Multiplicity and heterogeneity are also paramount in Angela Davis’s (1998) intersectional account of women blues singers’ music. Davis indicates how the women’s blues often employ multi-voiced modes of musical address that communicate different meanings to audiences of different races and heterogeneous Black audiences, and theorizes feminist (or “prefeminist” [24]) dimensions of this body of work, which must be distinguished from later feminist insights. Davis’s intersectional mode of interpretation brings out political meanings, including dimensions of Black working-class consciousness and lesbian and gay sexuality that single-focus categorial readings, as opposed to intersectional ones, inevitably miss (xi–xx, 39–41, 171–72). Finally, in terms of the politics of interpretation, theorists such as Gloria Anzaldúa (1987 [1999, 100]) and Kevin Quashie (2012) underline the need to loosen the hold that the notion of resistance exercises over critical practice, which is far from the be-all and end-all of aesthetic meaning that it is often taken to be in interpretations that focus on the politics and the public dimensions of cultural productions. A pluralization of aesthetic meanings, practices, and readerly modes, thus, is in different philosophical contexts a fitting strategy through which theorists deal with the complexities of identity and race and acknowledge the intricate structure of aesthetic creation, interpretation, and experience.

5.2 Politics of Emotion, Embodiment, and the Senses

Over the last decades, aesthetics has been powerfully inspired by affect theory, which in the work of Sara Ahmed (2004), illuminates the racial functioning of emotions, such as fear and hatred. Ahmed explores the ways in which emotions “circulate between bodies” (4), and how they both move and stick to people, objects, and nations, producing attachments and rifts among bodies. Thus she underscores the sociality and politics of emotions, which are key factors in shaping racial differentiations and positions (8–12). Given the importance of emotion in aesthetics and at the interface among makers and receivers of cultural productions and the objects they create or observe and participate in, Ahmed’s account carries powerful aesthetic implications. While sharing a focus on emotion, Francine Masiello (2018, 4–5), more broadly, concentrates on aesthetic figurations of the senses, which she links to a democratic politics during the modern era in Latin America as well as Europe and the United States. The framings of the senses that she traces point to the embodied and material dimensions of a politics of culture (3–4), including dimensions of gender, class, sexuality, and race and points up tensions between local and global developments. In reflecting on the politics of art, philosopher-artist Adrian Piper (1996, 102), whose art often uses direct modes of bodily confrontation to probe racialized, class-inflected, and gendered emotions, such as anger, disappointment, contempt, and unease, locates art’s potentialities for political transformation in a collaboration among artists and their audiences and celebrates art’s “tantalizing possibility of conceptual communion, of shared significance, of participation in the universal as an epiphenomenon of the subjective and concrete.” Accordingly, Piper combines an investment in the racial specificity of emotion and embodiment—and hence a commitment to the significance of racialized, corporeal differences and identities—with the persuasion that universality and common ground are key registers of art’s politics. Lastly, from a decolonial perspective, Walter Mignolo (2021, xii, xvi–xvii, 5, 55–56) and Mignolo and Rolando Vázquez (2013) employ the notion of aesthesis, understood by reference to the term’s Greek etymology as a practice of sensing and emotion, to overcome the entanglements of aesthetics with colonialist conceptions of rationality, and thus with historical regimes of racialization. The topic of affective, sensory, and bodily politics concerns dimensions of experience that have been the subject of critical phenomenological approaches (including in Ahmed’s work [2006]), and will return below (sections 6.1 and 6.2).

We have a lot at stake in emotion, sensation, and other embodied states. Given the focus of the aesthetic on these ample registers of life, which mark our social being and our interactions with the world, aesthetic existence emphatically exceeds the purview of critique and resistance, without thereby ceasing to carry political weight.

5.3 Politics and the Capitalist Marketplace

The racial politics of aesthetics and the political aesthetics of race have received attention from numerous theorists who zero in on the role of the capitalist marketplace in aesthetic life. This section selects three prominent approaches from a raft of philosophical options. From a Marxist, feminist, deconstructive, and psychoanalytic perspective, cultural theorist Gayatri Spivak (2012) discusses the potentialities of aesthetics in awakening desires and racial, gendered, and class positionalities that elude the grip of the global marketplace. She finds in a reading practice of “enter[ing] another’s text” (6), as exemplified by the humanities, shimmers of discourses that escape the capitalist logics of data processing and the circulation of information.

Building on the work of Silvia Wynter and Aníbal Quijano, philosopher Denise Ferreira da Silva gives a different spin to the relations between aesthetics and capital. Da Silva defines “raciality” as an “arsenal,” that is, a set of symbolic and scientific reasoning devices assembled to generate truths about the human as simultaneously separable and inseparable from things and, correlatively, about the economic as at once distinct and indistinct from the ethical (2022, 56–57). By analyzing the logic of this arsenal, she points to the inextricable entanglements between race, capital, and coloniality (76). For da Silva, modernity’s onto-epistemological categorial design and political architecture relies on sequentiality, among several other factors, to transform elements into worlds (2022, 58–59, 262–63). By surrendering linear temporality, aesthetics, in the form of Black aesthetics, then challenges this system (2022; 2021). Unyoked from time, existents and events, in da Silva’s view, are “no longer addressed as phenomena” but as entangled, singular “elementa” oriented toward the infinite (264). In her account of the figure of unpayable debt as invested in protagonist Dana of Octavia Butler’s novel Kindred, an image that da Silva argues post-Enlightenment modernity renders constitutive of Black people’s positionality, she indicates that racial justice can become comprehensible. In da Silva’s words, “Reading the book today inspires black persons to consider how much more could become possible, or how much of what does become possible expresses that which will never be. Putting it another way: once all are aware that the world, this world, is a composite of so much of what never came to be and what never will be, Dana’s unpayable debt becomes everybody’s” (265). Thus the prospect arises of the debt’s being “owned by those who ought to pay for it” (275), which presumably dismantles the operative conceptual and political architecture. According to Da Silva, operations of the figurative and the imagination have consequential roles in this context. Uncoupled from the post-Enlightenment onto-epistemic conditioning of understanding and combining critique with creativity, these procedures yield “modes of engagement that further the disassembling of the master’s tools and creative poethical tools that welcome other images of existence” (273). Aesthetics functions here as a vital source of social invention. Temporal logics are in motion; we become capable of envisioning social alternatives.

Similarly finding inspiration in Wynter’s critique of Western figurations of the human, cultural theorist Kandice Chuh underlines the “double-voiced” character of the aesthetic (2019, 2–3, 7–14). This twofold nature resides on the one hand in the productivity of sensibility as a part of the politics and epistemic dimensions of the liberal, modern humanist paradigm, understood as claiming individual autonomy for the human. On the other hand, it is found in the emergence through the apertures of the aesthetic of alternative sensibilities oriented toward humanity’s relational entanglements that are foreclosed by the liberal model, a process she describes as “poesis in critique” (3). The aesthetic, for Chuh, is then a site of “particularities,” “historicities,” and “incommensurabilities” (18), that, through the formation of sensibility enters into the production of racial difference and the conditioning of politics (19, 22).

Spivak, Ferreira da Silva, and Chuh each emphasize future-oriented promises of aesthetic practice. While this section has singled out three specific approaches, most writers on aesthetics and race take stances on the politics of commodification, extraction, fungibility, and other capitalist forms and histories, which are widely seen to be tightly interconnected with aesthetic and racial life.

5.4 Temporality

The theme of temporality dovetails with the question of capitalist governance and coloniality, which operate in the register of time (Muñoz 1999, 187–89; Vallega, 2014). According to Achille Mbembe, global capitalism engenders a temporal scheme that maintains itself through “an infinite series of structurally insolvent debts” and fosters a form of subjectivity that oscillates between fiction and the real (2013 [2017, 3, 5]). A global capitalist regime that is antithetical to democracy, argues Mbembe, has captured everyday existence (2010 [2021, 21–25, 33–34]). At the same time, the Global South produces “novel ways of articulating politics and culture” (25). Mbembe observes that on the African continent, linear constructions of time are being supplanted by “newer senses of futures” revolving around narrative, desire, affect, desire, provisionality, and uncertainty (2010 [2021], 10, 28–30; see also 2013 [2017, 147–8]). He associates Black art with an aesthetics and politics of life that aspires to freedom and a “liberation of hidden or forgotten energies” (2013 [2017, 173–174]). Through devices of play and metamorphosis, art deconstructs the existing social order and promises the subject’s rebirth “into life” (173). Writing under the rubric of “Democracy and the Poetics of Race,” Mbembe notes that “It is this utopian, metaphysical, and aesthetic supplement that the radical critique of race brings to democracy” (173–74). An intense aesthetic labor is needed, the work of invention, to reclaim humanity from the clasp of racial capitalism and coloniality (44). With the term Afropolitanism, he refers to an “aesthetic of intertwining,” of “assembling, disassembling, and reassembling” and a “migrant and circulatory form of modernity” (2010 [2021, 214, 221]). This mode of creativity, he suggests, is in a strong position to tackle large questions about “the relation of human life to planetary life in a context of geological recasting of historical time” (222). Enacting repetitions, indeterminacies, entanglements, and circularities, the aesthetic, thus, propels a project of envisioning modes of temporal engagement and positionality outside of frames of linear temporality.

For poet and theorist Fred Moten, the aesthetic exists in a relation of mutually animating autonomy to the political and economic (2017, 23, 26). Raising the question of whether “the pulse, the rhythm” must “be free in order to keep the time of freedom, to break unfree time, usher in new times” (12–13), he associates the Black radical tradition in literature, social theory, and the arts, specifically music and painting, with a rupturing anticipation of past by present and vice versa, and with a “forecast of a future in the present and in the past here and there,” that undergoes further upendings of “the very idea of the liberatory as well as its before and after” in connection with the movements of desire and other senses (9, 13, 29–30). This process is profoundly philosophical. In painter Chris Ofili’s series Blue Rider, Moten points out, “senseless sense” provokes thought, “conceptual motility,” indeed, “takes reflection for a ride” (235). Aesthetics, in Ofili’s paintings as well as in the work of multimedia artist Theaster Gates and in C. L. R. James’ and Cedric Robinson’s writings, Moten reveals, embodies an indispensable, temporally generative politics of “making and unmaking and remaking” racial positionality and materiality, enacting a “poetics of passage” (161).

Lastly, in her study of queer visual practices, Gayatri Gopinath (2018) uncovers aesthetic framings that contest mainstream conceptions of the Middle East and Asia as intelligible and mappable phenomena (5–6). By exposing queer aesthetic imaginaries in the work of the Lebanese artist Akram Zaatari, the Ethiopia-born Indian artist Shebha Chhachhi, and the Indigenous Australian artist Tracey Moffatt, among others, she pushes back against racial cartographies installed by capitalism and colonial modernity. In Gopinath’s readings, queer diasporic aesthetic practices bring the senses, affect, and the visual into intimate relations with each other. In this way, they develop new orders of history and memory and propose alternative figurations of space and time. Aesthetics, in this context, enacts a politics of queer temporality and spatiality.

The collaborations among emotion, desire, the senses, imagination, and thought that we have encountered several times under the rubric of aesthetics and politics receive ample attention from the side of a final set of perspectives that will be discussed in the next section, namely critical phenomenology.

6. Critical Phenomenology and Experience

A further area of sustained, generative inquiry into the interactions of aesthetics and race is critical phenomenology, the branch of phenomenology that explicitly attends to dynamics of race and intersecting forms of difference in accounting for the forms of meaning and experience that we engender as corporeal beings in interaction with the social and material world. This section considers three areas of inquiry within this field. They revolve around aesthetic experience, embodiment, and the potentialities of imagination and narration.

6.1 Critical Phenomenology and Aesthetic Experience

Phenomenological inquiry into the racial facets of aesthetic experience dovetails with political and temporal interests described earlier (see, e.g., Muñoz 1999, 187–89; 195–200). Problematizing in the context of artworks and museum shows frames of temporality that are complicit in racial colonialism, Alia Al-Saji (2019) theorizes the affective state of hesitation as a register of aesthetic experience that can shift dominant Western regimes of racialization that appoint racially othered people, such as Arab and Muslim groups, to a static past, while locating white people in a mobile present. Hesitation, Al-Saji argues on the basis of a reading of Fanon coupled with her own experience with various exhibitions and works, can bring “affective leeway” and “air” to stifling sensations of being stuck, providing “breathing and moving room” to “interrupt the mechanism of the aesthetic apparatus” and to “use it differently” (483, 486–87).

Noting the importance of recognizing both “the impositions of reality and the creative potentials of thought,” Lewis Gordon underscores that Africana phenomenology examines the lived reality of Black people “and the imaginative interplay of engagements with the social world” (2006, 28). Relatedly, he points out that while Black people’s experience is crucial to Africana thought, it cannot stand alone and must be coupled with their interpretations (30–32, 37). Experience and interpretation also come together in Gordon’s view of aesthetic production: He regards black music and literature as forms of “black existential reflection” (22–25, 46). Black aesthetics, meanwhile, is a vital dimension of the ways in which Black people produce meaning and value. Specifically, it gives expression to the value and mattering of Black people’s existence and the values orienting their lives, from “meaning to absurdity, pleasure to disgust, joy to sadness, and imagination to ritualized repetition” (Gordon 2018, 19–20, 24). Aesthetics for Gordon, in short, is an integral part of “what it means to live a human life” (24).

Phenomenological aspects of aesthetic experience take center stage in aesthetic perspectives that steer away from modes of cultural criticism that privilege dimensions of oppression, suffering, death, or as already indicated, resistance. Accordingly, Amber Jamilla Musser (2018) and Kevin Quashie (2012; 2021) shine light on aesthetic phenomena such as joy, pleasure, play, quiet, sensuality, excess, and aliveness. These phenomena, as Musser and Quashie furthermore indicate, encode queer sensibilities. Phenomenologically oriented approaches in aesthetics, in the scholars considered here as in many other cases, reveal how the aesthetic, while ethically, politically, and economically significant and efficacious, cannot be reduced to these other domains.

6.2 Critical Phenomenology and Embodiment

An extensive contemporary literature based in decolonial and Latina/x feminisms explores dimensions of the phenomenology of embodied existence. Aesthetics is a recurrent preoccupation in Latin American and Latinx philosophies of embodiment (Pitts, Ortega, and Medina [eds], 2020). Gloria Anzaldúa’s reflections on culture, belonging, nonbelonging, self, identity, and coalition across lines of difference ([1981] 2002, 1987 [1999]; 2009; 2015) are a locus classicus that continues to inform current phenomenological investigations of the aesthetics of embodiment. Early on, María Lugones (2003) had advanced our understanding of the aesthetics of liminality, or life in the borderlands, life led in transgression of cultural boundaries, with her famed notion of playful world traveling. Engaging Lugones among others, Alejandro Vallega (2014) describes a decolonial Latin American aesthetics. Invoking aesthesis, here defined as forms of bodily experience, affect, and sensibility that are “constitutive of the sense of being human and fundamental to human knowledge,” Vallega centers this decolonial aesthetics in “the pre-theoretical, pre-linguistic, and the pre-rational” (198–99). He underlines its liberatory potentialities and the ways in which it opens out onto a “shared lived time-space with the indigenous, with the Afro-Caribbean, with the criollo and mestiza lives, with European lineages and traditions, with the articulate thought of those many cultural groups that form and that are forming in the Americas” (217). The finely attuned practices of border-crossing, highlighted by Anzaldúa and Lugones, would appear to be germane to this opening.

Mariana Ortega (2025) theorizes the embodied dimension of aesthetics through the notion of carnalities, which refers to creative practices, including arts, that are attuned to cultural materialities and yield multisensory possibilities for worldmaking. Exposing carnal aesthetics in a wide range of contemporary Latina/x feminist and queer works of photography, she demonstrates its centrality as a source of experience, intimacy, memory practice, mourning, coalition building, and politics. Her theory gives race a place in a critical phenomenological account of the role of embodiment as a dimension of aesthetic production, reception, and being in the world. Capable of wounding, in the Barthesian sense of piercing and touching, and at the same time vitally offering sustenance, self-care, and emotional closeness, carnal aesthetics underlies our abilities to forge social alternatives in a world where border crossings cost many Latin American and Latinx subjects dearly and irreparably.

For Anzaldúa, Ortega, Chela Sandoval (2000), and Laura Pérez (2019), furthermore, erotic and spiritual dimensions are constitutive elements of bodily aesthetic life. Anzaldúa and Pérez theorize various forms of Indigenous aesthetics and their centrality to epistemic, cosmological, ecological, and sociopolitical outlooks, joining a cadre of Indigenous thinkers such as, among others, Davi Kopenawa (Kopenawa and Albert, 2010 [2013]), Vanessa Watts (2013; 2016), and Ailton Krenak (2019 [2020]; 2020 [2023]), who propose modes of bodily experience, interspecies relationality, and creativity that exceed white, extractivist, and anthropocentric aesthetic frameworks.

As noted earlier, aesthetic theory faces two significant problems in reflecting on race, namely the question of how we can acknowledge the complexity of matters of race and other forms of social identity and how we can recognize the specific nature of aesthetic interpretation, critical reading, making, and experience. Most of the approaches considered in this entry address these concerns in an implicit, if not explicit, fashion. Shockley’s view of the relation between textual forms or interventions and racial constructions and outlooks is among the explicit proposals. A related move can be discerned in José Esteban Muñoz’s (1999) account of disidentification, which, likewise, marks a distance between aesthetic productions and given identifications to make room for emerging forms of identification, what he, drawing on Norma Alarcón, calls “identities in difference” (6–7). Muñoz understands disidentificatory performance, as exemplified by queer-of-color including notably Latinx and Asian-Caribbean cultural practices, as a mode of temporal and spatial worldmaking (ix, 195–200). Race and identity, space and time, we find once again, are in motion in aesthetic experience and practice. They are exposed to rupture, modulation, and revision. Another proposal along these lines is Tina Campt’s (2021) notion of the production of a Black gaze in film and installation art, which transgresses given white-black oppositions and calls for a concentrated interpretive labor on the part of the aesthetic observer. Both aesthetic experience and race are recognized for the complex cultural dynamism they embody, rather than simplified and abstracted through already given modes of conceptualization and bodily comportment.

While aesthetic thought in Latinx, Black, and Indigenous contexts often foregrounds the problematic racial, class, and gendered functioning of human-nonhuman binaries, Anne Anlin Cheng (2019), by contrast, emphasizes the pivotal workings of human-object affinities and syntheses in a reading of aesthetic figurations of Asiatic femininities that steers away from differentiations between human and object, surface and interiority, aliveness and artifice, and abstraction and materiality implemented by Western epistemology and metaphysics. With the term “ornamentalism” she refers to a material culture that foregrounds the fusions of the bodies of Asian women with objects, resulting in a distinctly corporeal register of racial aesthetics and yielding an expansive array of intimate and political possibilities and impossibilities.

6.3 Experience, Imagination, and Narration

In theorizing the interface of aesthetics and race, philosophy runs up against limitations of the cultural archive. As Spivak (1988; 1999) points out in a variety of ways, the discursive position of subaltern people, that is, populations subjected to colonial violence and erasure, is marked by absences of speech and restrictions on audibility and interpretability, which renders it liable to discursive foreclosures. A vast reservoir of historical experience and phenomenological reflection is inaccessible, condemned to the realm of things not seen. Contemporary writers on aesthetics devise various ways of working around some of the resulting gaps and silences.

One strategy is to complicate the boundaries between the production of truth and the creation of fiction posited by earlier generations of philosophers and social theorists, including Du Bois and in some respects Baldwin. A case in point is Muñoz’s view of disidentification, which, not incidentally, is astutely indicative of Baldwin’s straddling of distinctions that he elsewhere appears to assert [1999, 15–21]). Through the notion of critical fabulation, cultural critic Saidiya Hartman (2008; 2019) furthermore theorizes and designs an intimate form of historical imagination that offers alternative stories to the hegemonic narratives ensconced in official archives. From an Africana and continental philosophical perspective, James Haile (2024; 2025), relatedly, employs imaginative storytelling as a method of phenomenological investigation, developing a practice of philosophically inspired and generative speculative fiction.

7. Conclusion

This study has concentrated on major theoretical perspectives, problems, and topics at the intersection of aesthetics and race. Attending both in an implicit and explicit fashion to philosophy’s dual concern with the complexities of identity and race and the intricate nature of critical reading, making, and aesthetic experience, the discussion has quickened and enriched the conceptual and phenomenological textures inscribed in the notion of the aesthetic, and in understandings and experiences of race.

Our selection of themes and concepts points beyond the archive addressed here: Far from exhaustive and geographically comprehensive, the entry outlines a set of densely entangled investigations that invite further dialogue from a profusion of angles. Africana and Latinx philosophical approaches have received significant emphasis, given their centrality to current discourses in the field. As is typical in an area as vast as the current one, the discussion is marked as much by what it leaves out as by what it includes. We have omitted subjects such as fashion, monuments, design, and performance. The same goes for substantive issues and debates concerning home (Ortega 2016), cosmopolitanism (Bhushan, 2009), metaphysics (Diagne 2007 [2011]), sound and perceptions/enactments of racial identity (Eidsheim 2019), anthropocentrism and the Anthropocene (Viveiros de Castro, 2012; Watts 2013; Danowski and Viveiros de Castro 2014 [2017]; Krenak 2019 [2020]), and the relations between futurity, pessimism, presentism, and utopianism (Mbembe 2013 [2017, 173–4]; 2010 [2021, 20], Taylor 2025). We have barely touched on the dynamic interplay between local structures and forces of globalization (Spivak 2012; Masiello 2018; Mbembe 2010 [2021]; Mignolo 2021) or on the notion of a racially inclusive “global” aesthetics (Higgins 2017; Feagin 2007), and we have left aside specific philosophical questions distinctly articulated by the arts, for example concerning technology and ecology, although by considering Baldwin on artistic creation, Muñoz’s disidentification, Gopinath’s temporal and spatial dislocations, Ferreira da Silva’s poethics, Cheng’s ornamentalist personhood, and Ortega’s carnalities, we have gestured in this direction.

While completeness is of course beyond the purview of this study, part of the entry’s upshot is worth keeping in mind as we move the discourse toward things as of yet unseen, unsensed, unfelt, unembodied, unimagined, and unheard: Both aesthetics and critical philosophies of race are undergoing a surge of interest within and beyond philosophy, within and beyond the academy. (A short sample of relevant anthologies, special journal issues, and other resources includes Lott and Pittman [eds] 2006; Roelofs [ed.] 2009; James 2013; Taylor 2016; Peterson and Eaton [eds], 2019; Pitts, Ortega, and Medina [eds] 2020; Harold [ed.] 2023; Kelly and Roelofs [eds] 2024; Flory 2008, 2025; Manresa [ed.] 2025.) That we have our deep values, delicate sensibilities and curiosities, and profound societal hopes at stake at the points where these endeavors interweave with each other is beyond question.

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Other Internet Resources

Acknowledgments

My thanks go to two anonymous peer reviewers, one of whom most generously provided detailed comments, from which this essay has benefited considerably.

Copyright © 2026 by
Monique Roelofs <m.roelofs@uva.nl>

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