Animal Normativity

First published Mon Aug 24, 2026

This entry reviews three strands of philosophical discussion concerning normative phenomena in nonhuman animals (henceforth, “animals”)—the extent to which animals may engage with and/or be cognizant of matters of value, such as morality, norms, and evaluative rules or standards. Historically, philosophers in the Western tradition have nearly universally assumed the absence of such phenomena in animals. Recent decades have, however, seen increasing openness to the possibility of morality, moral agency, social norms, and normative cognition in animals, in light of burgeoning scientific research into the social lives of animals. Debates over animal normativity have proven to hang as much on conceptual issues as on empirical details about the cognition and behavior of particular species, and have important potential ethical implications with respect to human obligations towards animals. They have, therefore, become fertile areas for philosophical investigation and have much relevance to contemporary work in philosophy of mind and cognitive science, moral philosophy, and animal ethics.

The first strand is the debate over moral psychology and moral agency in animals, which centers on which psychological capacities related to morality are present in animals—for example, the extent to which animals may be seen as capable of moral emotions, sentiments, or appraisals. Key questions include the degree of continuity or discontinuity between human moral capacities and the capacities of animals, and whether animals can be seen as capable of acting for moral reasons. These implicate long running philosophical disputes over the nature of morality and moral cognition, and give rise to questions about attributions of moral responsibility and praise or blame to animals.

The second strand focuses on social norms and normative cognition in animals. While closely connected to debates over moral psychology and moral agency, this has grown into an important field of investigation in its own right. Key issues concern the nature of social norms and how to identify them empirically, and the psychological requirements for evaluative mental states with respect to norms.

The third strand considers the implications of questions of animal normativity for debates about the ethical treatment of animals, both with respect to the moral status of animals—the extent to which animals are morally considerable—and questions about human obligations towards them—for instance, the kinds of harms that animals capable of moral or normative cognition may be liable to suffer and what conditions may be necessary for their wellbeing.

1. Introduction

Of all the differences between humans and other animals that have been asserted by philosophers, one of the most enduring has been that humans are uniquely normative animals. Only humans seem to live in the world of value and virtue; have a sense of right and wrong, and of how things should be, as opposed to what is the case; are capable of thought and action guided by normative considerations; and can be members of moral and political communities, structured by moral codes and other kinds of rules and norms, according to which their behavior may be evaluated. Indeed, while not always articulated explicitly, this seems to be a fixed point running through almost all of Western philosophy, at least from Aristotle onwards (Steiner 2005; Rowlands 2012).

While such claims remain common, philosophical and scientific interest in the possibility of normative or proto-normative phenomena in nonhuman animals, such as morality (Midgley 1991; de Waal 1996, 2006, 2013; Flack and de Waal 2000; Korsgaard 2006; Bekoff and Pierce 2009; Peterson 2011; Andrews 2013; Whitehead and Rendell 2015; Monsó and Wrage 2021; Monsó and Andrews 2022; Burkart et al. 2018; Wrage 2022; Wrage et al. 2024), moral agency and motivation (Clark 1984; Sapontzis 1987; Pluhar 1995; DeGrazia 1996; Dixon 2008; Rowlands 2012; Behdadi 2021), social norms (Rudolf von Rohr et al. 2011; de Waal 2014a; Andrews 2017; Schlingloff and Moore 2017; Vincent et al. 2018; Westra et al. 2024; Powell 2023; Lorini et al. 2024), and normative cognition (Andrews 2015, 2020a; Fitzpatrick 2020; Andrews et al. 2024; Danón 2019, 2026; Monsó and Moore 2024) has grown significantly in recent decades. This has been animated by scientific research indicating more complex social lives, cultures, and emotional and cognitive capacities than philosophers have historically been inclined to grant to animals (Boesch 2012; de Waal 2013, 2014b; Whitehead and Rendell 2015; Chittka 2022; see also entries on animal cognition and animal social cognition), and by ongoing interdisciplinary interest in the evolutionary origins of human normative phenomena, which necessarily requires a comparative perspective (Alexander 1987; de Waal 1996, 2006, 2013; Joyce 2006; Hrdy 2009; Churchland 2011; Kitcher 2011; Haidt 2012; Greene 2013; Henrich 2015; Tomasello 2016; Burkart et al. 2018; Heyes 2018; Wrangham 2019; Birch 2021; Raihani 2021; Sterelny 2021; Kumar and Campbell 2022).

Much work on animal normativity is also part of a larger pushback against what some see as the dominant anthropocentrism of Western philosophy, where claims of human uniqueness across a variety of cognitive and behavioral domains have simply been asserted without good evidence (Midgley 1991; Bekoff and Pierce 2009; Boesch 2012; de Waal 2014b; Figdor 2018; Andrews 2020b). However, while many traditional claims of human uniqueness are being re-evaluated, some have sought to hang on to the claim that morality, normative cognition, and moral agency does indeed set humans apart from the rest of the animal kingdom (Kagan 2000; Korsgaard 2006; Dixon 2008; Kitcher 2006, 2011; Ayala 2010; Carron 2018; Schmidt and Rakoczy 2019). This has led to a number of contrasting views about the continuity or discontinuity between human normative phenomena and potential analogs in animals.

Philosophical interest in questions of animal normativity is also heightened by the fact that they have proven to be as much conceptual as empirical. While the details of scientific studies of animal and human behavior are central, these debates implicate many classic disputes in philosophy, such as the definition and subject matter of the moral domain, the respective roles of emotion and reason in moral psychology, the nature of altruism and its relationship to morality, the nature of moral motivation, and when and where agents can be said to be morally responsible and or subject to moral evaluation. They have, therefore, provided fertile ground for interdisciplinary engagement between scientists and philosophers (de Waal 2006; Bekoff and Pierce 2009; Tomasello 2016; Roughley and Bayertz 2019; Westra et al. 2024). The extent to which other animals may be moral or normative creatures plausibly also bears on questions about the moral status and rights of animals (Rowlands 2012; Pierce and Bekoff 2012; Monsó et al. 2018; Nussbaum 2022; Simoneau-Gilbert 2024; Wrage et al. 2024; entry on the moral status of animals).

2. Animal moral psychology and moral agency

2.1. “Moral” animals

Reports of animals coming to the aid of others frequently elicit praise and other forms of morally-loaded language. Binti Jua, a gorilla at Brookfield Zoo (Illinois), assisted a three-year-old boy who had fallen into her enclosure. Binti Jua cradled the unconscious child and kept other gorillas away before he was retrieved by zookeepers. Biniti Jua’s actions were described as “heroic”, earning her a medal from the American Legion (Bekoff and Pierce 2009). More systematic observations of animal behavior provide other examples, including: chimpanzees removing snares (Amati et al. 2008) and cleaning groupmates’ wounds (Goodall 1986), adopting orphaned infants (Boesch et al. 2010), and helping groupmates safely cross roads (Hockings et al. 2006); African elephants assisting an ailing matriarch (Hamilton et al. 2006); dolphins and orcas helping groupmates deliver infants (Whitehead and Rendell 2015); ants rescuing trapped relatives (Nowbahari et al. 2009); and grisly experiments where rhesus monkeys (Masserman et al. 1964), pigeons (Watanabe and Ono 1986), and rats (Church 1959) deprived themselves of food after learning that accessing the food resulted in a conspecific receiving an electric shock.

Non-other-directed explanations are certainly possible in these cases. Perhaps the monkeys abstained from food because they found the conspecific’s response to the electric shock more aversive than hunger, not because they cared about the conspecific’s predicament? However, given the costs incurred by the helpers in many of these examples, they may seem apt to be described as instances of “altruism”, “empathy”, “sympathy”, and “compassion”—attributes central to many philosophical views about the primary concerns of morality. Such examples have, therefore, prompted discussion amongst both scientists and philosophers as to whether animals can in some way be viewed as “moral” creatures.

2.1.1 Descriptive and normative senses of “morality”

It is important to clarify that the terms “morality” and “moral” can be used in both descriptive and normative senses (see entry on the definition of morality). To talk of the “morality” of an individual or group of humans in the descriptive sense—the morality of the Hadza people, or of Pythagoras, say—is to talk about the code of conduct or values they endorse or practice, without making judgments about their correctness or justification. “Morality” in the normative sense refers to the correct or most justified system of values. Questions such as “Are animals moral?” are therefore potentially ambiguous. One might be asking a descriptive question about, say, the presence of a certain kind of psychological capacity or behavioral or social phenomenon in a particular species—some capacity for moral cognition, perhaps. Or, one might be asking about whether the relevant animals live up to a normative standard—for instance, whether an animal’s behavior qualifies it as virtuous. Popular discussions of “moral animals” often focus on seemingly praiseworthy or nice behavior (e.g., Binti Jua’s “heroism”), but an individual or community may have moral values or psychological capacities that engage with morality in the descriptive sense that are far from praiseworthy: moral creatures needn’t be nice or good. Moreover, there is an important debate over whether animals are legitimate objects of moral evaluation, even when they perform actions that would elicit praise or condemnation when performed by humans. Moral evaluability is often linked with responsibility and one might doubt that animals should be held morally responsible for their behavior; yet, some have argued that animals may still have psychological capacities that engage with morality (Rowlands 2012; Monsó et al. 2018; Borchert and Rumana 2023; Section 2.3).

Most philosophical discussions of morality in animals are intended to be descriptive, though normative issues have figured prominently in some discussions, especially debates over moral agency (Rowlands 2012; Section 2.3). Even when the goal is descriptive, it can also be difficult to avoid normative assumptions, since researchers have often appealed to classic theoretical frameworks from moral philosophy (such as Humean sentimentalism or Kant’s moral theory), which bring with them substantive commitments about morality in the normative sense. Metaphysical and epistemological assumptions about the nature of moral properties and moral knowledge also often lie in the background when philosophers articulate concepts such as moral cognition (Fitzpatrick 2017).

In addition, though references to “moral behavior” are frequent in these discussions, the general assumption is that behavior, by itself, isn’t enough. The relevant behaviors must have the right kind of psychology behind them to count as moral (in the descriptive sense): a mindless automaton could not be regarded as a moral creature. Hence, it is perhaps better to frame the question of whether animals can be moral creatures as whether animals possess psychologies in some way sensitive to matters of morality.

2.1.2 Empathy and sympathy

Research suggesting that some animals may possess forms of empathy and sympathy for social companions (Flack and de Waal 2000; de Waal 2006; Andrews and Gruen 2014; Adriaense et al. 2020; Newen and Griem 2021; Bartal 2024; Brooker et al. 2024) has been seen by some as sufficient to suggest that the relevant species do have moral psychologies. Here it has been common to draw on the sentimentalist tradition in moral philosophy, which includes Francis Hutcheson (1725), David Hume (1739–40), Adam Smith (1759), Sophie de Grouchy (1798), and feminist care ethics (Gilligan 1982; Noddings 1984; Tronto 1993; Held 2006; Gruen 2015). Famously, for Hume, our initial sense of morality stems from natural tendencies to share the feelings of those close to us (what Hume called “sympathy”): we experience the pleasures and pains of family and friends and then ourselves come to feel pleased, for instance, when an agent demonstrates qualities of character apt to produce pleasure in others. Moral appraisals, then, derive from other-directed emotional tendencies, and Hume was willing to grant similar tendencies to animals (Beauchamp 1999). Similarly, care ethics centers morality around caring for and meeting the needs of particular others, emphasizing empathy, compassion, and feelings of responsibility that have their natural origin in familial bonds and parental care. Though, as we will see, the sentimentalist tradition also contains arguments for distinguishing between human moral sentiments and animal emotions (Section 2.2.1), insofar as many social animals care about the welfare of companions it may seem reasonable to claim that they have moral sentiments that at least sometimes motivate them to engage in moral practices (Bekoff and Pierce 2009; Rowlands 2012; Wrage 2022; Monsó and Andrews 2022).

The terms “empathy” and “sympathy” have been understood in different ways across philosophy and psychology (Sober and Wilson 1998; Batson 2010; Prinz 2011; Gruen 2015; de Waal and Preston 2017; Adriaense et al. 2020; Eklund and Meranius 2021; Newen and Griem 2021; entry on empathy), however it has become common to use “empathy” as a general term for a variety of more or less complex processes through which one may come to share, simulate, imagine, or understand (accurately or inaccurately) the emotional state of another. Empathy is often understood as mediated by affect, such that one feels a similar emotional state—feeling with the other—though it is also thought to come in “colder”, more cognitive forms, where one may recognize another’s emotional state, without experiencing the same emotion. Empathy is thus typically categorized as a form of perspective-taking, with more complex forms involving mindreading (or “theory of mind”): reasoning about the mental states of others (see entry on animal social cognition). Sympathy is generally understood as feeling sorrow or concern for another individual. Empathy and sympathy are thus both other-directed. They may go hand-in-hand: detecting or sharing another’s distress may lead to sympathy. But, they may also come apart: as when one shares another’s negative emotional state, but feels no sympathy for them because one believes they deserve misfortune.

Experiments with rats have been claimed to indicate at least a minimal form of empathy and sympathetic concern for others (Bartal 2024). Sato et al. (2015), for instance, found that rats would open a door to allow a social companion who exhibited distress while in water to exit the water compartment. Rats who previously experienced being in the water compartment learned to free the companion faster. Given the choice between freeing their companion and access to food, rats tended to choose freeing the companion first (on alternative interpretations of these results, see Adriaense et al. 2020; Monsó and Andrews 2022; Bartal 2024).

The ethologist Frans de Waal (2006, 2013) has also argued for empathy and sympathetic concern in primates, citing cases of targeted helping and “consolation” behavior. Targeted helping is where an individual spontaneously provides assistance tailored to the other’s needs. De Waal (2006, 31–32) describes observations of a chimpanzee, Jakie, at Arnhem Zoo, who completed a task—removing a tire filled with water from a climbing frame—that his aunt, Krom, had failed to complete. Jakie placed the tire upright in front of Krom. De Waal suggests that Jakie understood Krom’s goal and had concern for Krom achieving it. Several of the helping behaviors described above have been similarly interpreted. Consolation behavior (de Waal and van Roosmalen 1979) is where friendly attention (e.g., hugging, touching, grooming) is given to others in distress in a manner that reduces the target’s distress—for example, bystander chimpanzees hugging the loser of a fight. Consolation behavior has been observed in chimpanzees, bonobos, some monkeys, rooks and ravens, dogs, dolphins, and horses (Adriaense et al. 2020; Brooker et al. 2024). Such behavior may be self-interested—for instance, directed at maintaining alliances—but it has been argued that much consolation behavior in humans and other animals is a spontaneous result of empathetic feelings producing sympathetic concern. The vivid interest many animals appear to have in dead and dying groupmates has also been interpreted as evidence of empathy and sympathy (Boesch 2012; Monsó and Andrews 2022; Monsó 2024), as has the seeming emotional impact of such events—for instance, African elephant calves who witnessed culling of family members displayed apparent symptoms of post traumatic stress disorder (Bradshaw et al. 2005; Hoffman 2020).

If such claims are correct, at least some animals may be psychological altruists: willing to help others for other-directed reasons—though how widespread and robust such tendencies are towards non-kin is a subject of much debate with respect to primates, in particular (Silk and House 2011; Burkart and van Schaik 2020). Psychological altruism requires other-directed motivation, whereas biological altruism requires that an individual’s action increases the reproductive fitness of another at potential cost to their own. A behavior may be psychologically but not biologically altruistic (e.g., motivated by concern about the welfare of one’s offspring) and vice versa (e.g., helping an unrelated other to gain help via reciprocation) (Sober and Wilson 1998; entries on altruism and biological altruism). There has been much debate over whether humans are ever psychological altruists (see entry on empirical approaches to altruism), though capacities for empathy and sympathy have been thought important for understanding psychological altruism when it occurs (Batson 2010). Also inspired by the sentimentalist tradition, the evolution of such capacities has been a major topic in theorizing about the evolution of human moral sensibilities (Darwin 1871; Sober and Wilson 1998; de Waal 2006, 2013; Kitcher 2011; Stueber 2019; Kumar and Campbell 2022).

2.1.3 Social expectations

Other forms of animal behavior have also invited comparisons with putative aspects of human moral psychology, such as concerns about fairness, following the rules or norms of one’s community (see also Section 3.1), and abiding by the terms of reciprocal arrangements.

Capuchin monkeys, chimpanzees, bonobos, domestic dogs, and other species have been claimed to exhibit aversions to “inequity”, protesting when a conspecific receives a better reward for performing the same task (Brosnan and de Waal 2003, 2014; Brosnan et al. 2005, 2010; McGetrick and Range 2018; Verspeek and Stevens 2023; Radovanović et al. 2025; though see also Ritov et al. 2024). Capuchin monkeys who received a piece of cucumber while their partner received a grape became less willing to participate, some throwing the cucumber at the experimenter (Brosnan and de Waal 2003). One alternative explanation (the social disappointment hypothesis; Englemann et al. 2017), suggests that participants protest that their treatment did not conform to their expectations, regardless of what their partner received (though see Radovanović et al. 2025). This doesn’t require any comparative sense of equity or fairness (“they got more for doing the same work”), but it may still indicate social expectations about how one is treated by others, in this case, the experimenter.

Some research with experimental economic games, such as the Ultimatum Game, has suggested that chimpanzees may be sensitive to and adjust their behavior in light of their partner’s expectations about division of resources (Proctor et al., 2013; for discussion see Andrews, 2020b; Sánchez-Amaro and Rossano, 2021; Sánchez-Amaro et al., 2024). Social play interactions have also been studied, with researchers claiming that they may be governed by “rules” about appropriate behavior—e.g., not playing too roughly or self-handicapping when playing with a weaker partner (Bekoff, 2001; Flack et al., 2004; Allen and Bekoff 2005; Bekoff and Pierce 2009). Additional examples of potential social norms in animals and the debate over them are discussed in Section 3.1.

Finally, various forms of reciprocal exchange for goods and services have been documented in animals (Schino and Aureli 2009; Brosnan 2024). Perhaps the most striking example is the mutualistic relationship of cleaner wrasses with their “client” fish. Cleaners eat the ectoparasites on clients, but not the more desirable client mucus (which would harm clients). Clients may punish cleaners who “defect” from this arrangement, and male cleaners chase away females who eat client mucus (Raihani et al., 2010).

While many are skeptical of analogies between such behaviors and human morality—for reasons that will be discussed—these and other examples have prompted researchers to speculate about the extent to which some animals may possess at least elements of a moral psychology.

2.2 What is required for a moral psychology?

A variety of different positions have been occupied with respect to the moral capacities of animals. Some have been willing to grant to some species key features of a moral psychology (Bekoff and Pierce 2009; Peterson 2011; Rowlands 2012; Monsó and Andrews 2022; Wrage 2022; Wrage et al. 2024); some recognize significant continuity with human moral capacities, but regard animals as only proto-moral (Darwin 1871; Midgley 1991; Flack and de Waal, 2000; de Waal, 2006, 2013; Boehm 2012; Haidt 2012; van Schaik 2016; Burkart et al. 2018); while others defend the traditional view that morality and moral psychology mark a key discontinuity between humans and other animals (Kitcher 2006; Korsgaard 2006; Dixon 2008; Ayala 2010; Carron 2018).

The debate between these viewpoints is animated by disagreement not only over the nature and best interpretation of the empirical evidence—for instance, whether studies of inequity aversion actually demonstrate a sense of inequity—but also over a number of largely conceptual issues, including:

  • The relationship between having a moral psychology and prosocial and other-directed capacities such as empathy and sympathetic concern for the welfare of others
  • The extent to which varieties of rational reflection and metacognition are necessary for having a moral psychology
  • The cognitive requirements for genuine moral emotions or sentiments
  • The relationship between having a moral psychology and moral agency (see Section 2.3)
  • The extent to which whatever unique moral capacities possessed by humans represent differences in kind or merely degree with animals

2.2.1 Animals and moral theory: Reflection conditions and proto-morality

If the sentimentalist tradition might initially seem friendly to moral capacities in animals, an obvious contrast is the Kantian rationalist tradition. Kant (1785) emphasizes the role of reason, rather than affect or sentiment in moral psychology. As contemporary Kantian, Christine Korsgaard, puts it, the “essence of morality” lies in “the ability to form and act on judgments of what we ought to do” (Korsgaard 2006, 116–117). Morality goes over and above empathy and psychological altruism, since it is ultimately about duty and obligation, not just being nice to others. Korsgaard argues that this places psychological sensitivity to moral concerns only within the reach of creatures with particularly advanced metacognitive capacities associated with the Kantian notion of autonomy or self-rule. While research has pointed to basic metacognitive abilities in some animals—for instance, monkeys and dolphins monitoring their level of uncertainty (Beran 2019; though see Carruthers 2008)—these fall short of what Korsgaard has in mind: “normative self-government”, which involves consciousness of one’s obligations and reasons for action as such; being able to reflectively stand back from one’s motivations, emotions, and reasoning to consider whether one should be so motivated, feel, or reason. Other rationalist or “intellectualist” approaches in the Kantian and social contract traditions are similar in insisting on reflection conditions for agents to engage with morality—for instance, being able to understand and agree to contracts governing cooperation with others (Rawls 1971). Hence, moral rationalists typically assume that genuinely moral cognition is only within reach of humans (though see Jebari 2019; Nelson 2024).

Reflection conditions are not exclusive to moral rationalism, though. In the Nicomachean Ethics, Aristotle requires that for an agent’s actions to be virtuous they must know they are performing a virtuous action, decide on the action because it is virtuous, and do so as a result of a stable character trait. Moreover, a genuine moral psychology, for Aristotle, requires practical wisdom (phronesis), where one is able to determine when one’s inclinations are properly directed. In a broadly Aristotelian vein, Dixon (2008) argues that animals can only possess compassion in a “thin”, nonmoral sense. Moral compassion goes beyond other-directed feelings and involves judgments about whether one’s feelings are properly directed—for instance, whether the target deserves kindness (on whether animals might still be capable of virtue, see Clark 1984).

In addition, while sentimentalist views place less emphasis on reason and reflection compared to rationalists, standard accounts also tend to insist on metacognitive requirements for agents to have genuinely moral sentiments. Adam Smith (1759) holds that sympathetic feelings only take on the character of moral judgments when made via an effort to synthesise the imagined perspectives of others, approximating the feelings of an impartial observer (Kitcher 2006; Carron 2018). Hume similarly requires aspiring towards “the general point of view” as necessary for genuinely moral appraisal, and therefore denies that animals have a sense of virtue or vice (Beauchamp 1999). Care ethicist Virginia Held (2006, 10) holds that “feelings need to be reflected on and educated” to count as moral. Other recent forms of sentimentalism emphasize complex self- and other-directed attitudes like guilt, shame, disgust, and contempt over empathy (e.g., Prinz 2007, 2011), also seemingly implying complex metacognitive abilities that may be unique to humans.

For some sympathetic to the sentimentalist tradition, such requirements on moral psychology proper still leave room for animals being proto-moral: possessing ingredients or “building blocks” of a moral psychology. Mary Midgley (1991, 9) asks whether the sympathetic tendencies of animals, “perhaps supply, as it were, the raw material of the moral life—the general motivations which lead towards it and give it its rough direction—while still needing the work of intelligence, and especially speech, to organize it, to contribute its form?”. That line of reasoning is developed most prominently by Charles Darwin (1871) and Frans de Waal (2006, 2013; Flack and de Waal 2000), who recognize significant continuity between human moral psychology and the “social instincts” of our closest primate relatives, while still holding that full-fledged morality evolved only in the human lineage. De Waal argues that primates possess capacities for empathy and sympathy and have a basic second-personal sense of fairness, but writes:

I am reluctant to call a chimpanzee a “moral being.” This is because sentiments do not suffice… There is little evidence that other animals judge the appropriateness of actions that do not directly affect themselves…. [M]oral emotions are disconnected from one’s immediate situation. They deal with good and bad at a more abstract, disinterested level. (2013, 17–18).

A similar perspective can be found in Haidt and colleagues’ moral foundations theory (e.g., Haidt 2001, 2012), which claims that the human moral mind is built on several universal innate and affectively-mediated moral “taste receptors”, including sensitivity to suffering and a desire to care for others, concerns about fairness and reciprocity, loyalty to the in-group, respect for hierarchy and social tradition, and concerns about purity or sanctity. Though more elaborated in humans, it is argued that several of these moral foundations are continuous with capacities present in other animals (see also Vincent et al. 2018; Andrews 2020b).

2.2.2 Moral psychology without reflection

Might insisting on elaborate reflection conditions for having a moral psychology “over-intellectualize” morality (Andrews and Gruen 2014)? Kantian normative self-government sets the bar notoriously high, arguably out of reach of many neurotypical human adults as well as young children and those with significant cognitive disabilities. Some researchers have been willing to attribute to infants a rudimentary “moral sense”, such as an early emerging preference for helpers over hinderers, before they develop elaborate metacognitive and perspective-taking abilities (Hamlin and Yuen 2025). Moreover, we often praise heroic humans for just springing into action and not thinking about whether to risk their lives to rescue others, seemingly implying a responsiveness to moral considerations that needn’t require reflection (Rowlands 2012; Rutledge-Prior 2019; Monsó and Andrews 2022).

Another worry about reflection conditions deriving from classic frameworks in moral theory is that they might conflate the descriptive question of what it is to have a moral psychology with questions about the metaphysics and epistemology of morality (Fitzpatrick 2017; Nelson 2024). For the Kantian (e.g., Korsgaard 1996), it is reflective self-consciousness and the norm that governs its operation—the Categorical Imperative—that provides the metaphysical ground for, and explains the objectivity and authority of, moral obligation. It is for this reason that Kantians emphasize normative self-government in moral psychology. However, it is one thing to say that normative self-government is the ground for morality and the Categorical Imperative key to acquiring moral knowledge, another to say that normative self-government is necessary for having a moral psychology at all. Reflection/perspective-taking conditions also play justificatory roles in Aristotelian and sentimentalist accounts: practical wisdom, corrected sympathy, imagining the feelings of the impartial spectator are how one gets one’s moral attitudes properly oriented. Running those two things together, though, obscures the distinction between moral theory and “commonsense morality”—the pre-theoretical moral intuitions (e.g., “murder is bad”) that moral theory typically aims to explain (Nelson 2024). Why couldn’t intuitions or reactive attitudes that give rise to the content of commonsense morality exist without the psychological capacities to which philosophers appeal to justify morality? If that is possible for humans, it isn’t clear why animals couldn’t have something like a moral psychology, even if they are unable to reflect on their moral attitudes or correct them when misdirected (see Wrage 2022 for a similar argument with respect to care ethics).

Along these lines, several philosophers have sought to articulate how animals may be at least minimally responsive to moral considerations (Rowlands 2012; Monsó 2015, 2017; Rutledge-Prior 2019; Wrage 2022). Consider a rat who saves a conspecific from drowning as a result of a feeling of distress they have “caught” from the conspecific via emotional contagion (a process of automatic affective state-matching believed to be present in humans and many animals; de Waal and Preston 2017; Adriaense et al. 2020). Instead of a largely internalist perspective, where the evaluative content of a mental state is determined by the agent subjecting it to the right kind of higher-order reflection, we may instead adopt an externalist account where the rat’s feeling of distress has as its object the distress of the conspecific, insofar as the mechanism that caused it tracks such states in others. If that mechanism also produces an urge to help others in distress, then the rat can be seen as motivated to help the other because of their distress. Since the distress of the conspecific is morally bad, the rat can be seen as, at least in a minimal externalist sense, psychologically sensitive to moral considerations—for instance, the proposition, “this creature’s distress is bad” (Rowlands 2012; Monsó 2015, 2017). Hence, animals needn’t have to make explicit judgments about the badness of the situation, or reflect on whether they should be motivated to help, to have mental states with moral content.

Other recent work has looked to moral theories outside of the Western canon. Wrage et al. (2024) appeal to the African philosophy of ubuntu, which emphasizes the role of community and the fundamental interconnectedness of people within moral communities (e.g., Mbiti 1990). Wrage et al. argue that ubuntu “moral communities” have the following characteristics: 1) cooperative care for individuals and community; 2) noncoercive leadership by, and respect for, elders. They argue that African elephants meet these requirements by engaging in cooperative care for infants within matriarchal family units, helping vulnerable members of the community, maintaining relationships in larger social networks, and elders having a key role as keepers of community knowledge. Hence, African elephants (and potentially other species with similarly complex interconnected communities) may practice, even if they don’t conceptualize, the values of ubuntu.

2.2.3 Continuity vs. discontinuity: Meta-philosophical issues

All the varying positions in the animal morality debate accept that humans have capacities seemingly related to morality that may be absent in other species: normative self-government (Korsgaard 2006), explicit moral judgment (Joyce 2006), the ability to (attempt to) adopt the general point of view or the perspective of an impartial spectator (de Waal 2006, 2013; Carron 2018) or the collective perspective of one’s community (Haidt 2012; Tomasello 2016), or the ability to formulate recursive moral principles like the Golden Rule (Thagard 2022). A large interdisciplinary literature seeks to explain how allegedly unique features of human morality may have evolved (e.g., de Waal 2006; Joyce 2006; Kitcher 2011; Boehm 2012; Tomasello 2016; Stanford 2018; Wrangham 2019; Kumar and Campbell 2022). Researchers, however, disagree over whether any such differences represent differences in kind or mere differences of degree, and hence whether animal capacities can be regarded as moral, only proto-moral, or have nothing to do with morality.

Debates over animal moral psychology thus raise interesting metaphilosophical questions about how we should decide between different descriptive characterizations of moral psychology and different approaches to developing such a characterization—e.g., what criteria of adequacy should be met when attempting to delineate “moral” from nonmoral capacities, and what should be the relationship between that project and the classic metaphysical, epistemological, and normative concerns of moral theory with respect to human moral discourse? Should such concerns drive what we say about animals, or should we think of the project more as articulating something like a natural kind, where the resultant characterization may force revisions to traditional philosophical assumptions about morality or moral cognition (Bekoff and Pierce 2009; Fitzpatrick 2017)?

Echoing concerns in the human moral psychology literature about whether it is even possible to delineate the moral domain in a defensible way (e.g., Kelly et al. 2007; Machery 2012; Machery and Stich 2022), some worry that debates about whether animals are “moral”, “proto-moral”, and so forth are just not very productive. The focus should instead be on more clearly-defined and tractable questions about the specific behavioral and psychological capacities of animals (Fitzpatrick 2017; Andrews 2020a). Others, however, still see value in using the question of morality in animals as a way to help us navigate how to define what it is to be a moral creature (e.g., Rowlands 2012; Monsó and Andrews 2022).

2.3 Animal moral agency

A standard conception of moral agency holds that moral agents: (1) can be held morally responsible for their actions (or omissions), and (2) can be praised, blamed, or otherwise morally evaluated in relevant circumstances (Rowlands 2012). Agency is, therefore, necessary, but not sufficient for moral agency. Moral responsibility is also distinct from causal responsibility: an agent may be causally responsible for harm, but not necessarily morally responsible for it (e.g., some cases of accidental harm; see entry on moral responsibility).

Discussions of morality in animals sometimes side-step or express ambivalence about the question of animal moral agency, either finding the concept of moral agency even more fraught than morality (e.g., Bekoff and Pierce 2009; Andrews 2020b), or because the focus is on psychological and evolutionary questions, not on issues of responsibility and evaluability that animate debates over moral agency (e.g., de Waal 2006; Burkart et al. 2018). Nonetheless, moral agency in animals is a key question for philosophers, not least since it is thought to be ethically weighty: moral agents have distinctive ethical interests and give rise to, but may also be bound by, certain moral obligations (Behdadi 2024; Delon 2024; Simoneau-Gilbert 2024). Questions of moral responsibility also motivate a common objection to attributing elements of a moral psychology to animals: such attributions make no sense if we do not wish to hold animals responsible for their actions (Carron 2017). This reasoning also often lies behind insistence on reflection conditions: only creatures capable of self-conscious reflection on their motivations and actions can be morally responsible and, therefore, candidates for a moral psychology (Korsgaard 2006; Dixon 2008).

Consider an incident in a wild chimpanzee community relayed by Safina (2020, 236–237), where a former alpha male (Duane), adopted the strategy of leading females away from the group to isolate and dominate them for sex. When Duane tried to lead away a female, Lola, there was some miscommunication: Lola presented for copulation, but Duane wanted her to go away with him instead. After repeatedly failing to get Lola to respond to his wishes, he beat her up and threw her from a tree. Lola died from her injuries. Safina describes this as a case of murderous rage born from frustration; it otherwise makes no sense for a male to kill a fertile female. What should we say about Duane here? Is his behavior morally evaluable—should we say that he acted wrongly?

Traditionally, philosophers have tended to assume that moral agents must be capable of understanding what they are doing and why, and whether or not they should or should not act in such a way. Hence, typically built into the requirements for moral agency are abilities to make moral judgments and reflect upon the demands of morality. Accordingly, young children and adults with severe cognitive disabilities, who have limited abilities to understand the implications of their actions, have typically been seen as lacking moral agency. This view would seem to imply that Duane is not morally responsible, insofar as chimpanzees are unable to reflect upon the demands of morality. However, the traditional view may not be adequate to many human cases of moral responsibility/evaluability (Rowlands 2012; Behdadi 2021, 2024; Delon 2024). Neurotypical adult humans are often driven by powerful emotions, and by habitual and unconscious processes that they are not necessarily aware of, and have little conscious control over, yet we still tend to regard them as morally responsible/evaluable (Doris 2015). A human adult acting from frustrated rage similar to that of Duane likely would be blamed, and it wouldn’t be much defense to claim they were overcome by emotion. Drug addicts and psychopaths are also generally thought to be to some extent morally responsible, in spite of their relevant impairments. And, while known to be emotionally volatile, chimpanzees definitely do have the ability to inhibit their impulses, and anticipate many of the causal consequences of their actions (de Waal 2014b). Setting the conditions for moral agency too high risks excluding too many humans, but lowering them makes it more likely that animals such as Duane should be seen as moral agents. There is also increasing enthusiasm for accounts of moral agency in young children and adults with putative agential deficits that admit that the boundaries of moral agency may graded and/or depend heavily on social context (e.g., children may be morally responsible/evaluable in some social situations, but not others) (Behdadi 2024). Such views also open the door to forms of moral agency in animals (Pluhar 1995; DeGrazia 1996; Shapiro 2006; Behdadi 2021).

A standard worry about animal moral agency, however, concerns punishment: should appropriately situated humans punish Duane for killing Lola? Notoriously, farmyard animals, dogs, rodents, and insects were subject to trials and public punishment by ecclesiastical and secular courts in medieval Europe (Carson 1917; Dinzelbacher 2002; Leeson 2013). Some scholars argue that the purpose of these trials may have been more about communicating messages to humans than reflecting sincere beliefs about animal wrongdoing (Leeson 2013). In any case, the putative absurdity of putting animals on trial has been seen as reason to deny that they can be moral agents (Rowlands 2012).

One possible response is to argue that moral agency should to be relativized to species and social context (e.g., Bekoff and Pierce 2009): animals may be moral agents within their communities insofar as they have moral standards, but not, for instance, when predating on other species, and shouldn’t be held responsible by humans or by human standards. Hence, in the context of his community, Duane might be judged to have acted wrongly, and it might be appropriate for other chimpanzees to hold him responsible should they have the capacities to do so, but it makes no sense for humans to hold Duane responsible.

A concern about such a species- and context-specific account of moral agency is that it makes it difficult to praise animal behaviors in inter-species contexts, such as Binti Jua helping a human child. But, if such interspecies interactions beyond the typical boundaries of community are morally praiseworthy, why shouldn’t we condemn Duane? Moreover, what grounds do we have for questioning the morality of human treatment of animals, if the limits of moral agency and evaluability are drawn at one’s group or species (Rowlands 2012)?

2.3.1 Moral subjects

A major part of the concept of moral agency is that moral agents are motivated by moral reasons. If the traditional assumption that animals aren’t moral agents is accepted, does that imply that animals also cannot be morally motivated? Rowlands (2012; 2017) argues that moral motivation and moral responsibility can and should be separated and suggests a new category: moral subject. A moral subject at least sometimes acts for moral reasons, even if they lack moral agency.

In defending the possibility of moral subjects that are not moral agents, Rowlands challenges an argument common between Aristotelian and Kantian views of moral motivation, which he refers to as the scrutiny-control-normativity-morality (SCNM) schema. SCNM holds that moral motivation requires metacognitive capacities because these are necessary for an agent to scrutinize their motivations, which is necessary to have control over those motivations, which is in turn required for those motivations to exert normative “grip” on the agent and provide moral reasons for action. An agent unable to scrutinize the content of their motivations cannot embrace or resist those motivations; it therefore makes no sense to say that they should embrace or resist them. Hence, their motivations cannot provide them with moral reasons for action. Rowlands rejects SCNM, arguing that a layer of metacognition on top of first-order mental states fails to explain why the agent has any more control over their motivations; it just raises the question of control again at the higher-order level. Rowlands (2017) also discusses the notorious murder of toddler, Jamie Bulger, by two 10-year old boys in Merseyside in 1993. The boys’ ages mitigate against them living up to SCNM and full moral agency, but the callous nature of their actions and that they admitted planning to kill a child reveals that they nonetheless had morally evil motivations.

Rowlands argues that animals can be understood as moral subjects insofar as their motivational states track moral propositions, such as “this creature’s distress is bad”. Rowlands defends an externalist consequentialist picture (Driver 2000) of this tracking relation: an agent’s motivational state(s) may have evaluative content in virtue of a systematic relationship between that state and good- or bad-making features of situations. An animal who reliably experiences distress as a result of the distress of a companion and is reliably disposed to help such a companion possesses an affective motivational mechanism that reliably tracks a bad-making feature of situations. This affective motivation has evaluative content and can be understood as a moral reason for action: the badness of their companion’s situation is what leads them to help.

The concept of moral subjecthood permits a distinction between the moral content of an action and its motivation and the praiseworthiness or blameworthiness of the agent. A moral subject may have good or bad motivations and make the world a better or worse place, but also not be a legitimate object of praise or blame: Duane (like the killers of Jamie Bulger) may be said to have had bad motivations, but shouldn’t be morally evaluated.

2.3.2 Responsibility and punishment

Recently, several philosophers have argued that we shouldn’t be too quick to dismiss moral responsibility in animals and that Rowlands’ distinction between moral agents and moral subjects is difficult to maintain (Borchert and Rumana 2023; Delon 2024; Simoneau-Gilbert 2024). In particular, it has been argued that Strawsonian “quality of will” accounts of moral responsibility (Strawson 1962; Arpaly 2003; McKenna 2012) are potentially applicable to animals (Ferrin 2019; Behdadi 2021; Delon 2024). “Quality of will” refers to the kinds of motivations that underlie an agent’s action: an agent may act out of good or ill will, depending on the extent to which they are motivated, for instance, by care or concern for others, or by indifference, disregard, or malevolence. Reactive attitudes such as gratitude or resentment are responses to this quality of the agent’s motivations. Quality of will views typically ignore or exclude animals, but it is also possible to articulate good and ill will as reflecting de re rather than de dicto responsiveness to moral considerations: an agent may manifest good will if they act for the right reasons whether or not they think about or conceptualize the content of those reasons. A person who helps a friend simply from a desire to make their friend’s day a little easier demonstrates good will; whereas, a person who takes pleasure in actively hindering a person’s project manifests ill will. In neither case, one might argue, need the agent think about the content of their motivations or their moral obligations. Animals may, therefore, be morally responsible/evaluable without going beyond the criteria for moral subjecthood: an elephant who helps an ailing matriarch due to a minimal form of sympathetic concern may be seen as manifesting good will, whereas Duane may be seen as manifesting ill will (and a legitimate object of resentment), insofar as he demonstrated indifference to Lola’s welfare. Borchert and Rumana (2023) make a similar argument for animals as legitimate objects of moral evaluation in the context of “reasons-responsive” accounts of moral responsibility (e.g., Fischer and Ravizza 1998).

What about the objection from punishment? Some have argued that there may be circumstances where forms of punishment of animals by humans are appropriate, depending on the capacities of the relevant species (Garthoff 2020). Nussbaum (2022), for instance, argues that we should hold appropriately trained domestic dogs to some extent accountable for, say, biting a child, insofar as they are capable of reliably following rules of “good” behavior (Nussbaum 2022).

Defenders of animal moral responsibility have also argued that animals such as Duane may be apt targets of moral appraisal, without us being obliged to hold them responsible. One might judge that a human is mistreating a family member, or that a foreign government is mistreating its citizens, but many practical, legal, and moral considerations may mitigate against intervention. Not all human wrongdoing falls under the jurisdiction of legal systems of punishment, and the standards for legal responsibility are typically higher than for moral responsibility—a standard that animal moral agents arguably may never satisfy (Simoneau-Gilbert 2024). Barriers to effective communication and the inability of animals to understand why they are being punished may also mitigate against punishment by humans (Cova 2013; Ferrin 2019). There may also be an asymmetry between praiseworthiness and blameworthiness (Borchert and Rumana 2023; Delon 2024). Examples of animal altruism may be relatively straightforward cases of morally good action meriting praise, whereas examples of putatively blameworthy behavior often involve considerations that make moral evaluation difficult. Predatory animals, for instance, don’t typically have alternative options to killing other animals (unlike humans), making the situation more like a moral dilemma, where one should not say that the animal is doing something wrong (Borchert and Rumana 2023).

The inference from animal moral agency to human punishment of animals might also be questioned on grounds of assuming a retributivist view of punishment—roughly, that it is intrinsically good that wrongdoers suffer punishment in proportion to the severity of their wrongdoing (Walen 2020). The dubiousness of human punishment of animals might be a reductio of retributivism rather than animal moral agency (Shupe 2021).

Accounts of animal moral agency raise interesting questions about human-animal relationships. For instance, insofar as domestic animals such as dogs and cats are capable of learning and conforming to “the rules of the house” and capable of having and responding to reactive attitudes (e.g., an owner’s praise or anger), it may be appropriate to regard human and animal members of the house as participating in what Behdadi (2021, 2024) calls “moral responsibility practices” (MRPs), with both being seen as potential moral claimants and defendants within these practices. Human-animal interactions in research laboratories, zoos, sanctuaries, and agriculture may also produce social expectations and associated reactive attitudes that give rise to MRPs. In light of different abilities to perceive and adjust to others’ reactive attitudes, and asymmetries in power relations, animals may less often be appropriately placed in the defendant position relative to human adults, but may still be seen as active participants in MRPs (Behdadi 2024).

3. Social norms and normative cognition

Social norms are the more or less informal rules that govern social groups, prescribing what counts as appropriate or inappropriate, permissible or impermissible, in a given social context (entry on social norms). Whether animal communities are structured by such rules, and whether animals have some corresponding normative sense, or ability to have ought-thoughts (Danón 2019; Andrews 2020a)—mental states not just about what is the case, but what should be the case—has been an important part of the debate over animal morality (Flack and de Waal 2000; Bekoff and Pierce 2009; Andrews 2020b; Behdadi 2021), though it received somewhat less attention in many discussions, in comparison to prosociality, moral emotions, and moral agency.

Recently, much more attention has been paid to this topic (Rudolf von Rohr et al. 2011, 2015; de Waal 2014a; Schlingloff and Moore 2017; Lorini 2018; Andrews 2020a; Fitzpatrick 2020; Danón 2019, 2026; Andrews et al. 2024; Lorini et al. 2024; Monsó and Moore 2024; Powell 2023; Westra et al. 2024). One reason is that social norms and “norm psychology” have become an increasingly important topic in theorizing about human cooperation and culture (entry on the psychology of normative cognition). Most of the human literature has assumed that social norms and norm psychology are uniquely human, motivating comparative researchers to consider whether this assumption is justified. In addition, persistent disagreement surrounding what we are talking about when we talk about “morality” has led some to focus on social norms and normative cognition in animals as a somewhat clearer and potentially more tractable area of investigation than morality (Andrews 2020a; Fitzpatrick 2017, 2020; Westra and Andrews 2022; Powell 2023)—though definitional controversies arise here, too (Andrews et al. 2024; Westra et al. 2024). Crucially, though philosophers have often sought to differentiate between “moral” and “non-moral” norms (e.g., norms of etiquette and convention; see entry on the moral/conventional distinction), the focus here tends to be on norms in general. In addition, with respect to the question of whether some animals may be capable of ought-thought, it is important to clarify that this sense of normative cognition is distinct from several varieties of responsiveness to reasons (Roughley 2019). A creature might, for instance, be psychologically responsive to moral reasons in the sense of Rowlands (2012; Section 2.3.1), or possess decision-making capacities sensitive to epistemic or prudential reasons for belief and action, without being sensitive to rules, norms, appropriateness, permissibility, and so forth. It is the “oughts” relating to the latter kinds of broadly deontic notions, rather than oughts in general, that are the primary focus.

3.1 Animal social norms

Social norms permeate almost every aspect of human life. Prototypical norms include those governing appropriate greeting behavior, queuing and personal space, dress, food, and other forms of etiquette, and institutional norms, such as those governing legal and legislative practices. While some norms are codified in laws and regulations, others are promulgated informally (e.g., tipping norms), and many are implicit and rarely articulated (e.g., norms about personal space). There is also significant cultural and historical variability in the content of norms, though human systems of norms may have some universal and potentially innate features, such as prohibitions of incest and battery (Mikhail 2011). Human propensities to readily learn and enforce social norms are seen as vital to understanding how humans became adapted to cooperate with unrelated group members and build large-scale societies (Boyd and Richerson 2005; Sripada and Stich 2007; Zawidzki 2013; Henrich 2015; Tomasello 2016; Sterelny 2021).

Norms are also emphasized in a philosophical tradition including Wittgenstein (1953), Hayek (1967), Sellars (1954, 1980), Brandom (1994), Searle (1995), and Nozick (2001), which sees humans as essentially “rule-following” or “nomic” animals (Lorini 2018; Roughley 2019). This tradition has exerted considerable influence over thinking about the nature and role of rules and rule-following in constructing human social realities and helping us to understand such phenomena as linguistic meaning, intentionality, and normativity itself (e.g., Brandom 1994; Searle 1995; Roughley 2019; Peregrin 2022, 2023). Philosophers interested in rational choice and social coordination have also had a keen interest in the nature and rational basis for social norms and related phenomena, such as conventions (e.g., Lewis 1969; Bicchieri 2006; Bicchieri et al. 2023).

With some exceptions (e.g., Hayek 1967; see Lorini 2018), until recently, the dominant view amongst philosophers and scientists interested in social norms has been that they are an exclusively human phenomenon.

3.1.1 Examples of possible animal social norms

The supposed human uniqueness of social norms has come under pressure from a variety of different examples of potential animal norms—though skeptics dispute whether any of them really are social norms. Primates have been a particular focus (Flack and de Waal 2000; Rudolf von Rohr et al. 2011, 2015; de Waal 2014a; Burkart et al. 2018; Kappeler et al. 2019; Andrews 2020b; Fitzpatrick 2020; Safina 2020; Westra et al. 2024), but examples outside of the primate order have been suggested for dogs and wolves (Bekoff 2001; Bekoff and Pierce 2009), whales and dolphins (Whitehead and Rendell 2015; Safina 2020), elephants (Slotow et al. 2000), and social insects (Powell 2023; Lorini et al. 2024). They involve a variety of different domains of social interaction (see Westra et al. 2024), including the following:

  • Social dominance hierarchies. Social hierarchies determine who gets to do what, when, and with whom. It has been suggested that at least some primate dominance hierarchies may be codified in systems of rules that individuals need to internalize and comply with to avoid potential sanctions (Nishida et al. 1995; de Waal 2014a). Powell (2023) suggests that social insects, such as bees, police the reproductive implications of dominance, such as punishing egg-laying by workers in colonies with a queen.
  • Special treatment of infants. Chimpanzees are highly tolerant of in-group infants, permitting infants to do things that would not be tolerated from juveniles and adults (Rudolf von Rohr et al. 2011, 2015; Safina 2020). Rudolf von Rohr et al. (2015) found that captive chimpanzees exhibited longer looking times at videos of chimpanzee infanticide than at videos showing violence between adults or group hunting of monkeys, suggesting a potential norm against harming infants.
  • Social play. Bekoff and colleagues (Bekoff 2001; Allen and Bekoff 2005; Bekoff and Pierce 2009) argue that dog play follows several rules, including a requirement for larger dogs to self-handicap when playing with smaller dogs, and that overly aggressive dogs tend to be excluded by others (see also Flack et al. 2004 for chimpanzees).
  • Costly cultural conformity. Animals sometimes conform to the socially learned behavioral “traditions” of their group in ways that impose costs on individuals, suggesting potential norms of conformity to local tradition (Whiten et al. 2005; Luncz and Boesch 2014). Vervet monkey groups were experimentally-induced with different preferences for blue- or pink-colored corn. Infants acquired the preference of their natal group, but then switched when they moved into a group with the opposite preference, despite food of both colors being provided, thus giving up a readily available food source (van de Waal et al. 2013). Two female chimpanzees were introduced into a zoo-housed group that has a female-specific behavioral tradition that limits walking efficiency, the “cross-arm walk”. One of the females adopted the behavior soon after introduction, while the other did not. Sometime later, the female who adopted the tradition appeared better integrated into the group (Goldsborough et al. 2021).
  • Social coordination. It has been suggested that sperm whales may follow a coordination norm of moderating sonar clicks when diving in close proximity to others to avoid harming each other’s hearing (Whitehead and Rendell 2015), and that ants follow traffic rules when multiple columns of ants go to and from the nest (Lorini et al. 2024).

3.1.2 Issues with identifying social norms

When evaluating such examples, it is important to note that norms are typically distinguished from mere statistical regularities in behavior. Observing people sheltering during a rainstorm does not suffice to indicate a norm. Norms go beyond what members of a community just happen to (not) do and behaviors induced by environmental conditions or biological needs. They rather reflect social constraints on behavior, where conformity to the relevant norm is a product of social incentives deriving from the reactions of others to (non-)conformity (Andrews et al. 2024).

A key question is thus how to distinguish between a social norm and a statistical regularity. This relates to philosophical debates about rule-following. Wittgenstein (1953) noted the seeming difference between acting in a manner that happens to be consistent with a rule and acting on the basis of the rule, where the rule guides (and explains) one’s behavior. Hence, it is important to distinguish conformity to a behavioral regularity from abiding by a norm (Schlingloff and Moore 2017). Instances of conformity to local cultural practices may therefore be insufficient to indicate social norms, since that may be explained by social learning biases, such as a disposition to copy the most frequently observed behaviors or the behaviors exhibited by a plurality of one’s groupmates, without there being any social sanction for deviance (what is sometimes referred to as “informational conformity” as opposed to “normative conformity”; Whiten 2019).

In light of this difficulty of determining whether the above cited examples are social norms, we can consider two sources of skepticism about social norms in animals: one is the claim that animals likely lack the psychological requirements to internalize and follow social norms; the second is the claim that we do not see the kinds of behaviors one would expect to see from creatures that possess social norms.

Various models of norm psychology and their implications for normative cognition in animals will be discussed in Section 3.2. Many of these assume purportedly human-unique capacities such as advanced metacognition or collective intentionality (e.g., Bicchieri 2006; Tomasello 2016), thus motivating skepticism about animal social norms. In response, defenders of the possibility of animal social norms typically argue for ways in which norms may be sustained in nonhuman communities without such requirements (e.g., Danón 2019; Andrews 2020a; Fitzpatrick 2020; Powell 2023; Andrews et al. 2024; Lorini et al. 2024). Westra and colleagues (2024; Westra and Andrews 2022; Andrews et al. 2024) argue that since there is little consensus about the psychological machinery that underpins human social norms, it is presumptuous to dismiss the possibility of social norms in animals based on assumptions about human norm psychology. Moreover, models of human norm psychology aim to explain a social phenomenon that should be characterizable in a way that doesn’t presuppose how it should be explained psychologically. Hence, to move forward on the question of whether social norms exist in animal communities, a clearer view of what social norms are as social phenomena is needed. Westra et al. suggest that social norms should be understood as normative regularities: socially maintained patterns of behavioral conformity in a community. The crucial notion here is social maintenance: social norms are patterns of behavior that members of communities conform to because such conformity is socially incentivized by sanctions and/or rewards from other community members.

The second form of skepticism about animal social norms derives from a common view about the kind of social maintenance we need to see to be confident that normative regularities exist in a community: third-party punishment. Theoretical work has emphasized third-party punishment as a means through which norms of cooperation can evolve and be sustained in human communities (Boyd and Richerson 1992; Sober and Wilson 1998; Matthew and Boyd 2011). Experimental work involving economic games has suggested that humans are “altruistic punishers”, willing to incur costs to punish antisocial players (Fehr and Gachter 2002), including when an unaffected third party (Fehr and Fischbacher 2004). This has led to claims that third-party punishment is constitutive of social norms (e.g., Riedl et al. 2012; Powell 2023). A weaker view is that third-party punishment is the only adequate behavioral evidence for the presence of social norms, since it is the only type of behavior that can get at the difference between responding to a norm violation and a violation of personal preference (Schlingloff and Moore 2017; Schmidt and Rakoczy 2019).

Current evidence of third-party punishment in animals is mixed at best (Nishida et al. 1995; Rudolf von Rohr et al. 2011, 2012; Riedl et al. 2012; Arseneau-Robar et al. 2016, 2018; Mendes et al. 2018; Powell 2023; Andrews et al. 2024). Arguably the clearest evidence is in cleaner fish, where males aggressively chase away females who eat client fish mucus (Raihani et al. 2010). However, while there is agreement that third-party punishment is a key form of evidence for social norms, several researchers deny that it is absolutely necessary (Andrews 2020a; Birch 2021; Fitzpatrick 2020; Theriault et al. 2021; Andrews et al. 2024; Westra et al. 2024). Humans may not be as eager to engage in third-party punishment as has been suggested (e.g., Pedersen et al. 2018) and the extent and nature of human third-party punishment is culturally variable (Marlowe 2009; Henrich and Muthukrishna 2021). Concerns have also been raised about how third-party punishment has been studied in animals (Suchak et al. 2016; Andrews 2020a; Fitzpatrick 2020), with the suggestion that current operationalizations of third-party punishment (e.g. Riedl et al. 2012) likely do not get at the full range of ways that punishment may manifest.

Westra et al. (2024; Andrews et al. 2024) argue that a broader view of social maintenance is needed that goes beyond third-party punishment: normative regularities might be sustained by a variety of different forms of social maintenance, both negative (i.e., punitive) and positive. Positive social maintenance may include social inclusion, partner recruitment, and gains in social status that derive from conformity to a normative regularity, and pedagogical or facilitative behaviors on the part of others (e.g., mothers or alloparents) that nudge individuals to conform (Andrews et al. 2024). Interesting to consider in this context are the cases of apparent cultural conformity in animals, such as the immigrant chimpanzee who later appeared better integrated into the group after adopting the cross-arm walk behavior compared with the immigrant who did not adopt that behavior (Goldsborough et al. 2021). That might suggest the presence of positive social maintenance in terms of social inclusion or gains in social status for conformity. Westra et al.’s approach therefore calls for further research into potential mechanisms of social maintenance in animal communities, including but not limited to third-party punishment, as a way to establish the (non)existence of social norms in animals.

Another form of behavior that has been thought indicative of a readiness to acquire and follow social norms in humans is over-imitation: a tendency to copy causally unnecessary as well as necessary features of an action (Lyons et al. 2007). Over-imitation is thought to serve the function of learning norms, social rituals, and conventions that are frequently arbitrary or opaque (Legare and Neilsen 2015; Hoel et al. 2019). The putative absence of over-imitation in animals (see, e.g., Horner and Whiten 2005; Clay and Tennie 2018) has also been seen as reason to doubt the existence of social norms (Zawidzki 2013). Others have questioned both the necessity of over-imitation as evidence of social norms and the putative evidence against over-imitation in animals (Allen and Andrews 2024; Andrews et al. 2024; Fitzpatrick 2025; see also Huber et al. 2020, 2022; Mackie et al. 2024; Gerwisch et al. 2025, on over-imitation in dogs).

The Westra et al. (2024) account of social norms as normative regularities might be considered too inclusive. When Mormon crickets swarm, they gather and march, eating as they go, cannibalizing swarm-mates who don’t march. This looks like a normative regularity, since cannibalization of non-marchers is a form of (negative) social maintenance, but, surely, Mormon cricket marching is not a social norm? Westra et al. (2024; Andrews et al. 2024) are not troubled by this apparent permissiveness, arguing that social norms can exist in lots of different ways and can be underpinned by a wide range of different underlying psychological processes (Andrews et al. 2024). Some social norms may be emergent products of very simple behavioral dispositions (as in the crickets), while others, like norms of language usage in humans, may have much richer psychological processes behind them. This perspective suggests that the question of whether social norms exist in a community can be separated from questions about whether animals mentally represent rules or understand the normative expectations of others.

3.2 Models of normative cognition

To what extent may animals be capable of thinking about the world in normative terms—for instance, having some sense of the difference between what is and what ought to be the case? Aside from disagreement over the empirical evidence for social norms in animals, much of the debate here has turned on contrasting views about the psychological requirements for ought-thoughts. Predominantly with humans in mind, a number of different models of normative cognition have been developed by philosophers and cognitive scientists (see also entry on the psychology of normative cognition). A major aspect of the variation between them is how cognitively demanding they are, and this has implications for how applicable they may be to nonhumans.

Kantian models are the most demanding, claiming that it is the reflective structure of human self-consciousness that gives rise to the ability to think about oughts, both in the context of instrumental rationality and with respect to the social world (Korsgaard 2006). Without capacities for reflective scrutiny, an individual would seem to be at the mercy of their desires and motivations, unable to distinguish between what they happen to do and what they should do. Kantian models make it unlikely that animals have ought-thoughts, though a common objection is that they might also make it unlikely that young children and even many human adults have them (Danón 2019; Andrews 2020a). Critics have also argued that it is a false dichotomy to assume that the only alternative to a full Kantian autonomous agent is a mere “wanton” pushed around by their desires (Camp and Shupe 2017; Danón 2026).

Shared intentionality. Another popular framework for understanding human normative cognition links it with capacities for shared (or joint) intentionality (Tomasello 2016; Schmidt and Rakoczy 2019; Gonzalez-Cabrera 2022): the ability to adopt a “we” mode of representation, where one may understand, for instance, that oneself and another agent are pursuing a joint project together as a plural agent (e.g., taking a walk; Gilbert 1990). Tomasello (2016) argues that a primitive normative sense emerged uniquely in human evolution via the evolution of this capacity (and develops ontogenetically as children begin to engage in more complex joint activities), the idea being that thinking about joint activities from the perspective of a plural agent gives rise to a sense of obligation towards others and expectations about how others should behave. With a further broadening of “we” perspective-taking to larger groups (collective intentionality) a more developed normative perspective emerged. Tomasello and colleagues’ claim that shared intentionality is uniquely human (Tomasello et al. 2005) has been challenged by arguments that animals such as chimpanzees, bonobos, and dogs demonstrate some putative behavioral signatures of the phenomenon, such as attempting to re-engage a partner when a joint activity is disrupted (e.g., Heesen et al. 2020; Horschler et al. 2022; Papadopoulos and Andrews 2022; Papadopoulos 2023), though it isn’t clear whether this may extend to larger group-level (collective) intentionality.

“Norm system” models. Another approach to human normative cognition posits an innate “norm system” specialized for acquiring, motivating conformity to, and enforcement of, the norms in one’s cultural environment (Sripada and Stich 2007; Chudek and Henrich 2011; Kelly and Davis 2018). Proponents of this view typically hold that social norms are represented in a rule-like manner in a “norm database” and the system produces ought-thoughts—often affectively-laden normative judgments about one’s own or others’ behavior—in light of these internalized rules and information about the relevant behavior in question. This model does not require capacities for shared intentionality or advanced metacognition, though proponents typically hold that such a norm system evolved uniquely in the human lineage (e.g., Chudek and Henrich 2011; Stich 2020). Others have argued that it might be shared with other great apes (Fitzpatrick 2020).

Naïve normativity. Andrews (2020a, b) offers a minimalist picture of normative cognition, which requires that an organism is able to: 1) identify agents; 2) distinguish between in-group and out-group agents; 3) learn local group cultural traditions via social learning; and 4) demonstrate sensitivity to the appropriateness of others’ behavior in light of of those traditions. Andrews argues that there is good evidence that many animals meet conditions 1–3. The capacity underlying 4, sensitivity to appropriateness, Andrews characterizes in affective terms, as a tendency to respond with negative emotions when a norm violation is detected or positive emotions in response to norm conformity. The naïve normativity model shares with the norm system account that normative cognition can be largely automatic and unreflective, but doesn’t assume that norms are necessarily represented in a rule-like manner.

Predictive-processing models. Another approach to the origins of normative sensitivity is developed in the context of a predictive-processing model of cognition and links it to prediction-error minimization (Colombo 2014; Theriault et al. 2021). The idea is that the brain seeks to minimize discrepancy between predicted and actual sensory information and updates its predictive models of the world in light of prediction error. Since error is metabolically costly, there is a premium on prospective strategies for minimizing error. One way to make one’s social environment more predictable is to do what others expect one to do—i.e., the behavior of others becomes more predictable when one doesn’t violate their expectations about one’s own behavior. What Theriault et al. (2021) refer to as a sense of should is a felt inclination to conform to the social expectations of others emerging from a general imperative to minimize prediction error. Though the model primarily focuses on norm conformity, it opens the door to recognizing the existence of varieties of ought-thought in animals, insofar as it doesn’t presuppose any clearly human unique cognitive processes.

Pluralistic norm psychology. The models just described generally assume that norm psychology can be articulated in a single unified manner. An alternative pluralistic perspective (Westra and Andrews 2022; Andrews et al. 2024; Westra et al. 2024) holds that the capacities that sustain social norms vary along a number of different dimensions. Social norms may exist without any ought-thoughts behind them, but also ought-thoughts can exist at different levels of complexity, from implicit representations of rules, to non-propositional representations, to propositional representations of rules, to public and linguistically expressed rules. This makes it quite likely that some animals may have capacities for ought-thought, even if the most rarefied variants, such as linguistically expressed normative judgments, are unique to (some) human beings.

Instrumental normative cognition. When thinking about potential capacities for ought-thoughts in animals it is also important to consider non-interpersonal contexts. When building a Lego model, one may have an expectation about how it should look, according to which one may evaluate the adequacy of what one has built. Birch (2021) and Sterelny (2021) argue that instrumental normative cognition in skilled tool use and manufacturing may be the source of human normative cognition in the social domain. Evaluative mental states emerged first in the context of complex skilled behavior guided by an internal model that determines what counts as a correct or incorrect outcome, and were then co-opted into the social realm (see also Gonzalez-Cabrera 2022). Birch and Sterelny argue that normative model-guided skilled behavior emerged only in the human lineage. Westra and Andrews (2021) and Danón (2026), however, argue that skilled animal behavior, such as the selection and use of different sticks and probes for termite fishing by chimpanzees, indicates normative understanding of what properties an adequate tool should have. Lorini et al (2024) make a similar case for ants being sensitive to imperfections in things like nest construction that may also suggest instrumental ought-thoughts.

4. Animal normativity and animal ethics

Potential attributions of moral or normative capacities to animals have been seen as ethically consequential, by calling into question traditional assumptions of human exceptionalism (Pierce and Bekoff 2012; Rowlands 2012; Monsó et al. 2018; Benz-Schwarzburg 2020; Simoneau-Gilbert 2024; Wrage et al. 2024). More specially, questions of animal normativity are directly relevant to debates over the moral status of animals, the nature and extent of their moral entitlements, and the conditions necessary for their wellbeing.

The concept of moral agency has been important for moral philosophers in part because it has often been thought to play a role in determining moral status—the extent to which a given entity is morally considerable, whose interests should be considered in moral decision making (see entry on the moral status of animals). The claim that animals are not moral agents has frequently been used to justify the claim that animals lack moral status and humans have no direct duties to animals. Versions of that argument can be found in the Stoics, Augustine and Aquinas, and in Descartes and Kant, among others (Steiner 2005). Some social contract views also hold that only rational agents capable of understanding and agreeing to contracts governing the terms of their cooperation count as subjects of justice whose interests should be considered in the framing of the social contract (e.g. Rawls 1971; Carruthers 1992, 2011; though see Rowlands 1997).

The possibility that animals may have some form(s) of moral agency (Sapontzis 1987; Pluhar 1995; DeGrazia 1996; Bekoff and Pierce 2009; Ferrin 2019; Rutledge-Prior 2019; Behdadi 2021; Delon 2024) is a potential threat to such views, though much hangs on the kind of agency at stake. Strict Kantians may deny that animals have the kind of agency—Kantian autonomy—that matters for moral status, but arguments for animal moral agency also tend to call for “de-intellectualizing” human moral agency (DeGrazia, 1996; Ferrin 2019; Rutledge-Prior 2019; Behdadi 2021; Delon 2024), thus potentially challenging efforts to restrict the kind of agency that matters for moral status to humans (on varieties of agency and moral status, see Sebo 2017; for a recent Kantian defence of animal moral considerability that doesn’t require moral agency, see Korsgaard 2018).

Many alternative approaches to moral status deny that moral agency is necessary—for instance, sentience-based or “subject of a life” approaches (e.g., Singer 1975; Regan 1985). However, even if moral or normative capacities aren’t necessary, they may still be relevant to the relative value or extent of animal interests. Machan (2004, 34), for instance, argues that human moral agency elevates human interests over those of animals: “human life involves moral tasks, and that is why we are more important than other beings in nature. We are subject to moral appraisal”. If the lives of some animals also involve relevantly similar “moral tasks”, then a different argument will be needed, or the interests of animal moral agents will need to be similarly elevated. Meanwhile, Rowlands (2012) argues that animals capable of acting for moral reasons (even if not full moral agents), are owed a form of moral respect in virtue of being capable of making the world better (or worse).

It is commonly held that creatures with richer social and mental capacities may have more ways in which their lives may go well or badly and thus have a broader and more complex range of needs. Along these lines, it may be argued that moral/normative animals have distinctive ethical interests. For instance, if some animal communities can be considered “moral communities” (Wrage et al. 2024), if some animals engage in forms of “moral care” (Monsó et al. 2018; Wrage 2022; Wrage and Benz-Schwarzburg 2023) or if there exist moral codes or social norms in animal communities in the wild or in captivity (Bekoff and Pierce 2012; Fitzpatrick and Andrews 2022; Westra et al. 2024), then it may be argued that humans have obligations not to disrupt these practices, and potentially to facilitate them.

Moral capacities in animals may also require recognizing a broader scope of harms that they may suffer at human hands. Monsó et al. (2018) argue that animals that engage in emotionally-mediated caring behaviors towards others are harmed when their capacities of care are inhibited, such as animals in agriculture or biomedical research, who are typically exposed to the distress of conspecifics, but also prevented from manifesting or developing their caring capacities. Monsó et al. argue that not only do these animals likely experience the distress of others around them, suffering subjective or hedonic harm, they are “doubly harmed” by their caring inclinations in response to others’ distress being thwarted or eliminated. Cooke (2019, 2021) argues that some practices in agriculture and biomedical research leverage the other-directed tendencies of social animals to foster trust and compliance with caretakers, which is then exploited and “betrayed”, creating an additional harm of instrumentalizing relationships of care and trust.

This line of argument calls for a broader conception of animal wellbeing than typically found in conceptions of animal welfare, which tend to focus on physiological health and functioning, minimization of pain, or the presence of “natural” or “species-typical” behavior. Monsó et al. (2018) appeal to Nussbaum’s (2006, 2022) capabilities approach to wellbeing, which relies on the concept of flourishing as the kind of being one is. This is realized through the exercise of various “central capabilities” (each of which may manifest differently in different species) that include life, bodily health and integrity, senses, imagination, and thought, emotions, practical reason, affiliation, co-existence with other species, play, and control over one’s environment. Normative capacities of various kinds, such as empathy, care, capacities for social norms, and so on, can be connected with several of these capabilities. Nussbaum (2022) has further developed the approach into a theory of inter-species justice: every sentient being is entitled to conditions and resources to realize their central capabilities to at least a minimal level (for discussion, see Read and Birch 2023).

Moral or normative capacities in animals also have potential implications for their place in the political domain. Aristotle famously holds that only humans are zoon politikon (political animals) because only humans are capable of participating in an ordered political community. However, animal ethicists have increasingly considered the possibility of viewing animals as, to varying degrees, political agents (e.g., Donaldson and Kymlicka 2011; Meijer 2019; Nussbaum 2022). Donaldson and Kymlicka (2011) argue that domestic animals should be considered citizens in multi-species political communities alongside humans, and communities of wild animals should be viewed on an international relations model as nations with sovereignty rights. A key component of this account is that animals shouldn’t be assumed to be always passive recipients of human treatment, but can engage in nonverbal forms of agency (see also Meijer 2019)—for instance, domestic dogs can shape the terms of living arrangements with their owners through their preferences and interactions, with both human and animal learning to adapt to the expectations of the other. Such views are potentially strengthened if some animals are recognized as having their own political-like structures, such as social norms or “moral communities” (Wrage et al. 2024), or having forms of agency that may facilitate varieties of nonverbal decision-making and negotiation over the terms of their relationships with humans (e.g., Behdadi 2024), making potential room for a “more-than-human” politics (Donaldson and Kymlicka 2023).

Others remain skeptical that animals can qualify as political agents. Pepper (2021) argues that the standards for political agency are considerably higher than for the kinds of moral or normative agency that may plausibly be ascribed to animals, including requirements to intentionally affect institutions and imagine alternative political futures. There may also be potential ethical risks in over-attributing agential capacities to animals (Delon 2024)—for instance, potentially motivating more negative attitudes towards “nuisance” animals, such as those involved in Human Wildlife Conflict, by seeing them as more responsible for behavior that harms humans.

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